Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Notes to Free Will

1. His view is discussed in several places. See, for example, Summa Theologiae I, q.82 (1945, vol.I) and Questions on Evil, q.6 (1993).

2. Plato's views on the soul and its powers are set in numerous places. See, e.g., The Republic, Book IV; Phaedrus, 237e–238e and 246–248; Gorgias, 466. All are found in (1997).

3. Note that Aristotle here sees origination in the agent and ability to do otherwise as closely related. Robert Kane (1996) suggests that while some form of ability to do otherwise is indeed necessary for moral responsibility, this condition is but an indicator of something deeper to free will: the willing's finding its ultimate origin in the agent.