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Proof of the Falsification Theorem

Likelihood Ratio Convergence Theorem 1—The Falsification Theorem:
Suppose the evidence stream cⁿ contains precisely m experiments or observations on which h_j is not fully outcome-compatible with h_i. And suppose that the Independent Evidence Conditions hold for evidence stream cⁿ with respect to each of these hypotheses. Furthermore, suppose there is a lower bound δ > 0 such that for each c_k on which h_j is not fully outcome-compatible with h_i, P[∨{ o_ku : P[o_ku | h_j·b·c_k] = 0} | h_i·b·c_k]  ≥  δ—i.e. h_i (together with b·c_k) says, via a likelihood with value no smaller than δ, that one of the outcomes will occur that h_j says cannot occur). Then,

P[∨{ eⁿ : P[eⁿ| h_j·b·cⁿ]/P[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ] = 0}   |   h_i·b·cⁿ]

    =     P[∨{ eⁿ : P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ] = 0}   |   h_i·b·cⁿ]

    ≥     1−(1−δ)^m,

which approaches 1 for large m.

Proof

First notice that according to the supposition of the theorem, for each of the m experiments or observations c_k on which h_j is not fully outcome-compatible with h_i we have

(1−δ)	≥	P[∨{oku : P[oku  |  hj·b·ck] > 0}   |   hi·b·ck]
	=	∑{oku∈Ok: P[oku | hj·b·ck] > 0}   P[oku | hi·b·ck].

And for each of the other c_k in the evidence stream cⁿ—i.e. for each of the c_k on which h_j is fully outcome-compatible with h_i,

P[∨{o_ku : P[o_ku | h_j·b·c_k] > 0}   |   h_i·b·c_k]  =  1.

Then, we may iteratively decompose P[∨{eⁿ : P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ] > 0}   |   h_i·b·cⁿ] into it's components as follows:

P[∨{eⁿ : P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ] > 0}   |   h_i·b·cⁿ]

=   ∑{en:P[en | hj·b·cn] > 0}   P[en | hi·b·cn]

=   ∑{en:P[en | hj·b·cn·cn−1·en−1] × P[en−1 | hi·b·cn·cn−1] > 0} P[en | hj·b·cn·cn−1·en−1] ×                      P[en−1 | hi·b·cn·cn−1]

=  ∑{en:P[en | hj·b·cn] × P[en−1 | hi·b·cn−1] > 0} P[en | hj·b·cn] × P[en−1 | hi·b·cn−1]

= ∑{en:P[en | hj·b·cn] > 0 & P[en−1 | hi·b·cn−1] > 0} P[en | hj·b·cn] × P[en−1 | hi·b·cn−1]

=  ∑{en−1: P[en−1 | hj·b·cn−1] > 0} ∑{onu∈On:P[onu | hj·b·cn] > 0} P[onu | hi·b·cn] ×                       P[en−1 | hi·b·cn−1]

=  ∑{en−1: P[en−1 | hj·b·cn−1] > 0} P[∨{onu: P[onu | hj·b·cn] > 0} | hi·b·cn]  ×                    P[en−1 | hi·b·cn−1]

≤  (1−γ) × ∑{en−1: P[en−1 | hj·b·cn−1] > 0}   P[en−1 | hi·b·cn−1],

if cn is an observation on which hj is not fully outcome-compatible with hi

or

=   ∑{en−1: P[en−1 | hj·b·cn−1] > 0}   P[en−1 | hi·b·cn−1],

if cn is an observation on which hj is fully outcome-compatible with hi

…

continuining this process of decomposing terms of form ∑{ek: P[ek | hj·b·ck] > 0}   P[ek | hi·b·ck] (in each disjunct of the ‘or’ above, using the same decomposition process shown in the six lines preceding that disjunction), and realizing that according to the supposition of the theorem, this decomposition leads to terms of the form of the first disjunct exactly m times, we get

…

≤	m Π k = 1 (1−γ)   =   (1−γ)m.

So,

P[∨{eⁿ : P[eⁿ  |  h_j·b·cⁿ] = 0}   |   h_i·b·cⁿ]
  =  1 −  P[∨{eⁿ : P[eⁿ  |  h_j·b·cⁿ] > 0}   |   h_i·b·cⁿ]   ≥     1 − (1−γ)^m.

We also have,

P[∨{eⁿ : P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ]/P[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ] = 0} | h_i·b·cⁿ]
  =  P[∨{eⁿ : P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ] = 0} | h_i·b·cⁿ],

because

P[∨{eⁿ : P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ]/P[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ] > 0} | h_i·b·cⁿ]

=	∑{en: P[en | hj·b·cn]/P[en | hi·b·cn] > 0} P[en | hi·b·cn]
=	∑{en: P[en | h j·b·cn] > 0 & P[en | hi·b·cn] > 0} P[en | hi·b·cn]
=	∑{en: P[en | h j·b·cn] > 0} P[en | hi·b·cn]
=	P[∨{en : P[en | hj·b·cn] > 0}   |   hi·b·cn].

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Copyright © 2011 by
James Hawthorne <hawthorne@ou.edu>