Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Supplement to Inductive Logic

Proof that the EQI for cn is the sum of EQI for the individual ck

Theorem: The EQI Decomposition Theorem:

 When the Independent Evidence Conditions are satisfied,

EQI[cn | hi/hj | b] = n
∑
k = 1 		EQI[ck | hi/hj | b].

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Proof:

EQI[cn | hi/hj | b]
 =  ∑{en} QI[en | hi/hj | b·cn] × P[en | hi·b·cn]
 =  ∑{en} log[P[en | hi·b·cn]/P[en | hj·b·cn]] × P[en | hi·b·cn]
 =  ∑{en−1} ∑{en}(log[P[en | hi·b·cn·(cn−1·en−1)]/P[en | hj·b·cn·(cn−1·en−1)]]
         + log[P[en−1 | hi·b·cn·cn−1]/P[en−1 | hj·b·cn·cn−1]]) ×
          P[en | hi·b·cn·(cn−1·en−1)]  × P[en−1 | hi·b·cn·cn−1]
 =  ∑{en−1} ∑{en} (log[P[en | hi·b·cn]/P[en | hj·b·cn]]
         + log[P[en−1 | hi·b·cn−1]/P[en−1 | hj·b·cn−1]])  ×
          P[en | hi·b·cn]  × P[en−1 | hi·b·cn−1]
 =  (∑{en} log[P[en | hi·b·cn]/P[en | hj·b·cn]] × P[en | hi·b·cn]  ×
                 ∑{en−1} P[en−1 | hi·b·cn−1])
+ (∑{en−1} log[P[en−1 | hi·b·cn−1]/P[en−1 | hj·b·cn−1]] × P[en−1 | hi·b·cn−1] ×
                 ∑{en} P[en | hi·b·cn])
 =  EQI[cn | hi/hj | b] + EQI[cn−1 | hi/hj | b]
 =  …   (iterating this decomposition process)

 = 
n
∑
k = 1 		EQI[ck | hi/hj | b].