Table of Contents
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Despite much thought, over thousands of years, by philosophers and scientists, however, we seem little closer now to an agreed account of color than we ever were. The disagreement is reflected in the fact that some theorists believe colors to be dispositions or powers to induce experiences of a certain kind, or to appear in certain ways to observers of a certain kind. Others take them to be objective, physical properties of objects. Among the latter group, some take these properties to be physical microstructures, while others regard colors as sui generis irreducible properties of physical bodies, and yet others take them to be dispositional properties to affect light. Finally, there are even some who deny that there are colors in the world at all: there are none of the colors, it is claimed, that we naturally and normally and unreflectingly attribute to objects.
The major problem with color has to do with fitting what we seem to know about colors into what science, particularly physics, seems to require of physical objects and their qualities. It is this problem that historically has led the major physicists, who have thought about color, to hold a common view: that the colors we ordinarily and naturally take objects to possess, are such that physical objects do not actually have them. Oceans and skies are not blue in the way that we naively think, nor are apples red, or green. Colors of that kind have no place in the physical account of the world that has developed from the 16th Century to this century. Physicists who have subscribed to this doctrine include the luminaries: Galileo, Boyle, Descartes, Newton, Young, Maxwell and Helmholtz. In this doctrine, they were joined by a number of fellow travellers, including most famously, John Locke.
Such a view is clearly paradoxical, given what we said above, about the ubiquity of colors in the perceived world, and about the importance of colors in the identification and re-identification of physical objects. The physicists were aware of the paradoxical nature of their views. While some clearly welcomed this consequence, others thought it possible to mitigate the paradoxical character of the doctrine by drawing a distinction between two concepts of color: (i) color as a sensory quality, intrinsic to our sensory experiences; (ii) color as a power, to induce sensory experiences with color in the first sense. On this account, color terms have a systematic ambiguity. Provided we take account of the ambiguity, no harm is done, and much benefit derived. According to this view, then, in one sense of "color", physical objects have colors, for they have the power to induce experiences of color, but in the other sense, they do not. The paradox of the physicists' position might be resolved by claiming that, when we enjoy visual experiences, then in some sense we project the sensory quality in our experience on to physical objects. One who exploited this idea to great effect was David Hume, who used our experience of color as a model for thinking about the way we attribute causal connections, necessity and moral predicates to objects and situations in the world (remembering that Hume adapted the model to his own terminology of `impressions' and `ideas').
There have been many who have felt unhappy with this paradox and with the resolution offered. While this feeling has been strongest among philosophers, it has certainly occurred elsewhere. It should be noted, however, that the physicists' view seems to be widely shared by people who work with color or on color, i.e designers, painters, physiologists, physicists, chemists, industrial color workers, those who construct color systems, etc. It is also interesting that among the critics of the physicists, there is a wide diversity of views about what the right account of color is. A wide variety of proposals have been made. They may be divided into accounts which are objectivist and perceiver-relative, respectively. Objectivist accounts include those that construe colors as intrinsic, non-relational properties and those in which they are relational, dispositional properties.
Various reasons have been given for dissatisfaction with the physicists' position. It has been variously argued that: (i) the notion of `color as it is in experience' is incoherent; (ii) the physicists' doctrine encapsulates a confusion about what the ordinary, natural concept of color is; (iii) those who defend the doctrine forget that there are other sciences besides physics, for example there are biological sciences such as zoology, botany, ecology, and so on, in which colors do have a role to play that they do not have in physics and chemistry; (iv) those who defend the doctrine forget that color has a social role to play; that colors are important in social life, and the criteria for application of color predicates are based on that social life; (v) the ordinary, natural concept of color, the `folk' concept is not as the physicists and their friends believe. Two common forms that this last criticism can take are as follows:
Much of the criticism of the physicists' position is based upon the claim that the notion of "color as it is in experience" is confused [see Westphal (1987), Hacker (1987) and Evans (1980)]. This criticism seems based however on narrow interpretations of the texts, without serious attempt made to make sense of the opponents' views. Descartes and Locke certainly made mistakes but it is hard to see that they could have been so silly as they are often presented as being. [See Maund (1991) and (1995)]
It is possible to reconstruct the physicists' position on color, as expressed by Descartes and Locke. They were right that there is a natural concept of color which is such that objects do not have colors. Their way of characterising the concept, however, is at fault. It should not be described as "color as it is in experience". There may very well be a coherent notion of "color-as-it-is-in-experience" or "color as a sensory quality", but that notion is not the natural concept of color. The natural concept is more plausibly construed as a concept of a certain kind of property: it is an intrinsic perceiver-independent feature of physical surfaces (i.e. it is not a dispositional property either to affect light or to appear to observers). It is possible, moreover, to specify the natural concept in more detail. One feature of colors so conceived is that they can be defined by paradigm examples. Two consequences follow. One is that a specific color is the sort of property that can be detected or recognised by looking, i.e. it is not an unknown quality of physical surfaces. This point is illustrated by the fact that colors together form a system of qualitative features, that resemble and differ from each other in systematic ways. These qualitative features are "sensuous" in the widest sense, e.g. in the way in which a landscape, a painting, a dress, or a film by Visconti, can be sensuous. A second consequence is that the color has a causal role to play in the identification or recognition of the color, by the act of looking. Colors, we might conclude, are manifest, intrinsic (non-dispositional) properties that have distinctive causal roles to play.
Given that colors can be specified as properties of this kind, it is then possible to argue that there are no actual properties that satisfy all the conditions set down. Those in the Locke-Descartes-Helmholtz tradition who emphasise the need for a distinction between color-as-in-physical-objects and color-as-in-experience are best interpreted as thinking that there is no physical feature in physical objects that satisfies all the requirements (that serves all the required roles) of color. [For an alternative interpretation, see Thompson (1995)] Oversimplifying, there is no set of features of physical objects which both make-true sentences such as `ripe bananas are yellow', `Perth skies are blue', `Granny Smith apples are green' etc. and which, as a group, have the right kind of internal relations to each other. With respect to historical figures such as Locke, Descartes and Helmholtz. It might be more accurate to say that what they believed was that there is no set of features of physical bodies that both makes the sentences true and also has the richness and sensuousness and variety and texture that we take colors to have.
Summarising, we have the following set of proposals for how colors should be conceived:
Colors are properties that play a significant role in our epistemological, personal and social lives. They are important epistemologically, i.e. as signs for the identification and re-identification of physical objects. They serve both as natural signs and as social, conventional signs. In the second place, they may also be said to have a `life of their own'. That is, they are used in social life to amuse, to entertain, to delight, to shock, to impress, to astound, to warn, to attract, to be enjoyed, and so on.
The way colors play these various roles is through a variety of conceptual practices that we engage in. Here I am including among the conceptual practices the way experiences represent (or present) objects as having colors. (Such experiences have conceptual content.) If we reflect on, and analyse these practices, and on the forms the respective roles take, it is possible to identify what we might call "the natural concept of color". The natural concept is the concept of a certain kind of property: one that the perceiver's perceptual color experiences represent objects as having, one that is captured by the color language that natural language-users employ and so on. The natural concept is the concept of color that is embedded, explicitly and implicitly, in the conceptual and social practices of competent color perceivers and users of color language.
It is tempting to call this natural concept "the folk concept of color". This temptation should be stoutly resisted. For one thing the "folk concept" gets easily conflated with "the folk theory", i.e. some doctrine that we in our naive moments would articulate if asked, and if we had the time to reflect on. There are two things wrong with this slide. In the first place the natural concept is a concept (or set of related concepts) not a theory. In the second place to call it a theory is to over-intellectualise the concept. Rather, the concept is one embedded in a vast set of conceptual practices, engaged in by color experts, those who are competent in the perception, recognition and use of colors. The knowledge is implicit as well as explicit, and it involves know-how besides.
There is another problem with talking of folk concepts and folk theories. It has the unfortunate tendency of implying that since it is the concept or the theory of "the folk", it is ripe for replacement. It is better not to give any encouragement to such a tendency here. It is important to emphasise that the ordinary folk are experts in color. Color experts are not just those who study color in a scientific way, nor those who paint in colors, nor those who are industrial chemists. There are, in other words, different ranges and levels of expertise. Those of us who are competent with colors know a lot: we know what color blue is, how it differs from red and from yellow and green; we know how dark blue differs from light blue; we use terms such as rich, pale, faded, intense, brilliant, bright, pure, mixed, and so on to convey and exploit what we know.
With respect to color, there is a set of conceptual practices, linguistic and non-linguistic, that we who are color-competent (in varying degrees) engage in. Not only do we identify, sort and classify colours, but we use them for a variety of epistemological and social purposes. They are important epistemologically, i.e. as signs for the identification and re-identification of physical objects, serving both as natural signs and as social, conventional signs, e.g. as badges, uniforms, for ceremony etc. In the second place, they are used in social life to amuse, to entertain, to delight, to shock, to impress, to astound, to warn, to attract, to be enjoyed, and so on, in contexts having to do with pageantry, ceremonial, courtship, painting, lighting, plays, clothing, dining, drinking, and so on. Simplifying, we engage in a set of practices in which we use colour-terms and we use colours.
If we analyse these conceptual practices, i.e. the practices that make use of colors and color terms, then it is possible to draw up a list of general principles or features that colors satisfy, or possess. Implicit in this list will be a set of truths, "color truths" let us call them, which can be explicitly formulated. There are specific truths such as tomatoes are red, lemons lemon and so on. There are such truths as reds merge into blues and also into yellows but not into greens. Blues merge into greens and reds, but not into yellows. That is, there are reddish-blues but not reddish greens; reddish yellows, but not blue-ish yellows. And so on. Then again there are principles of contrast: yellow makes a stronger contrast with black than with white. Most significant of all is that colors can be placed in a systematically ordered arrays, along three dimensions, e.g. hue, saturation, and brightness. There are different arrays according to whether the colors are surface colors, film(aperture) colors, volume colors, light colors etc. Each array has a distinctive, complex character: a fourfold structure, based upon four distinctive, unique hues: green, red, blue and yellow. All colors can be mapped according to how near to or far from they are to any two of these unique, primary colors. [See Hardin (1989) and Maund (1995) for discussion of the significance of this character of color arrays.] Moreover, more than one such color system can be constructed even for the one mode of appearance: the Oswald, Munsell and Swedish Natural Color systems are examples. The last-named for example, uses dimensions of hue, chromaticness and whiteness/blackness, whereas the Munsell system uses hue, chroma and lightness. These dimensions are most suitable for surface colors, whereas hue, saturation and brightness are more appropriate for aperture colors.
It is possible to formulate general principles which are causal in nature, e.g. ripening pears, bananas and wheat go from green to yellow, acids turn blue litmus paper red, spiders with red stripes on the back are venomous, black hair tends to grow grey with age, and so on. Moreover, there are certain aesthetic and emotional facts. For certain people, green is soothing. Soft pastels are suitable in certain contexts; mauves and browns are not. Light colors and dark colors have different effects on mood, and so on. Certain colors are harmonious, and others jarring. In addition, there are truths comprising the way perceived colors vary with illumination, distance, orientation, and so on. There are other truths concerning how the color of surfaces is affected by the background against which an object is seen.
In describing as we have, the general features of colors, what we are doing is describing the roles colors play and the forms that these roles take. We still want to know what kinds of properties colors are that enable them to play those roles. Are they intrinsic properties of physical bodies, or dispositional properties of an objective kind, e.g powers to modify light, or are they dispositional properties that are subjective, at least in part? The best way to answer this question is to try to identify among the general features of color those features and principles that are most central. These are the features which provide an organising basis for unifying the wide set of general features described. We are looking for what might be termed "the real essence" for colors (though we are not committed to using that terminology). Candidates for the real essence will be:
There is a flourishing field of color science, one that goes back to Newton and includes such famous figures as Young, Maxwell, Helmholtz, and Hering. Almost all of this field has to do with the perception of color, that is, to studying the conditions that cause or contribute to colors being seen, or to ways in which the colors as they appear may be studied. An example of the last is the many studies involved in the specification of colors. Typically these involve matching techniques in which the subject is asked to match some stimulus with one or another of a range of standardised cases. More recently the area has seen a growth in the study of color vision, i.e. of the mechanisms involved in the perception of color. Helmholtz and Hering were pioneers in the physiology of this area, but much has been done recently in research on the neural processes involved in color perception. A crucial development has been the growth in opponent-process theory. [See Kaiser and Boynton (1996) for technical discussion. See Hardin (1988) and Thompson (1995) for philosophically-informed discussions.] Also of significance are the experiments by Land and his colleagues and the development of his retinex theory of color vision. [See Land (1983) and also Hardin (1988) and Thompson (1995) for critical discussion.] Uncovering the mechanisms that underlie color vision is an exciting current field of research. The major philosophical relevance of such research is that it promises to help explain why some of the appearances of color have the character that they do, e.g. why there are no reddish-greens nor bluish-yellows. If it becomes clear that appearances have a certain character which no set of objective physical features have, and that character can be found to based on the physiological/neural processes, then the research may be crucial in establishing that color is best thought of not as some objective feature of the world that color vision detects, but rather as something constructed by one's color vision.
Another area of color science has to deal with the construction of color systems, i.e. of ways of ordering the range of colors in a systematic fashion. Usually this is done by constructing three dimensional color solids. It is interesting, however that there are different systems that have been constructed. For one thing different dimensions are used depending on the way in which color appears. Colors as properties of surfaces, in general, have a different mode of appearance from colors as properties of volumes such as wine, and yet again from that for film color or aperture color. These different modes of appearance suit different dimensions of color. For surfaces the dimensions (at least in some systems) are hue, chromaticness and whiteness/blackness; for aperture or film colors the dimensions are hue, saturation and brightness.
Through the development of different aspects of color science over the past two hundred years, we have discovered a modest wealth of information about color. Summarising very briefly, that information can be grouped under different labels:
Almost all of this research in color science is devoted to the way color appears, i.e. to the conditions under which one perceives color or experiences it or to the character of the way color appears. Almost none of it is concerned with the other color `truths', that is, to what we might call "causal truths and principles". This is not to say that those `truths' or principles are false or are invalid. Biology and chemistry and indeed physics all use color concepts and claims in their theories (some of them) and explanations, but there has not developed what might be called a science of color, except for the study of the way color appears, or one might say, of the way colors are represented, and of the causes and conditions conducive to the way they appear and are recognised.
There is an important difference between color science, on the one hand, and the science of shapes, geometry, the science of heat and temperature, and the science of sound, on the other hand. In the case of shapes and heat/temperature, and sounds and weights, we have properties of physical objects which we can detect, naturally and unreflectingly, by the use of our senses. These properties, however, are different from colors. In the case of shape and heat and weight and sound, there has developed a science in which the principles of sound, weight, heat, and shape are studied. There is however no parallel science of color. There are no color principles that serve as the basis for a science of color. There are color truths which seem to go against this, since they appear to appeal to causal explanations in which colors are used, but appearances here are deceptive. These causal explanations do not depend on the causal efficacy of color. The causal truths are ones in which color is relevant because color is a sign or indicator of some other feature which is causally efficacious. Color science is a large field, but it is built around the way that colors appear and to the conditions under which colors can be perceived, and the causes which lead to the perception of colors. If colors ceased to appear in the distinctive ways then color science would disappear.
In developing this field of color science, one is trying to build up a store of color facts which contribute to our understanding of the perception of color, as well as to provide an objective specification of color. With both aims, the scientific account has to take account of a range of color facts that hold of the practices and behaviour of color-perceivers. That is, before we discovered any detailed scientific knowledge about color, we had - and still have - a considerable body of knowledge about color.
This body of color knowledge is contained within the conceptual practices specific to color. By studying these practices, we can draw up a set of general color principles and `truths'. The range and extent of the general principles, have been emphasised by Justin Broackes (1992). [For further discussion, see Maund (1995).] These general facts or principles include causal truths, although the nature of the causal powers may be difficult to discern. It is easy to see that color science has both filled out the details of some of the color principles described previously, e.g. in respect to the internal relations and to the conditions under which color is perceived, and in some case modified them. Furthermore, the discovery of color-mixing laws and of the mechanisms underlying color vision has added to our knowledge of color.
L: Principles about the Use of Color Terms:
A: Principles about Appearances and the Perception of Color:
T: Color Truths of the First Order:
R: Principles about Colors and Their Roles:
It needs to be emphasised that these categories are not meant to be exclusive. For example, principle R3, concerning the social and psychological role of colors is related to principles T4 and T5, concerning the specific aesthetic and emotional roles of colors. Likewise the principles in A6 and T2 both refer to the sensuous nature of colors. Reference to the sensuous nature of colors concerns both colors and the way they are represented. This point will no doubt be controversial, but it ought not be. It is because colors have distinctive appearances that those who are competent with colors can reflect on the way colors appear, i.e. on the way that one's color experiences represent objects as having colors. Reflecting on the way colors are represented, the reflective observer can say that the sort of property colors are represented as being are as color "stuffs" spread on the surface of physical bodies (or through volumes, etc.). They are intrinsic features of physical surfaces (volumes, . . .), spread over the surface. It seems only too clear that we experience the redness of a ripe apple as an objective quality of the apple, the redness being in an objective space just as much as are the shape, the contour, the texture of the apple. This point can be neatly illustrated by quotes from two eminent workers on the physiology/psychology of color, Hering and Boynton. Hering for example, writes:
When we open our eyes in an illuminated room we see a manifold of spatially extended forms that are differentiated or separated from one another through differences in their colors . . . Colors are what fill in the outlines of these forms, they are the stuff out of which visual phenomena are built up; our visual world consists solely of differently formed colors; and objects, from the point of view of seeing them, that is, seen objects, are nothing other than colors of different kinds and forms. [Hering (1964) p. 1]In similar vein, the physiological psychologist Richard Boynto n writes in `Color in Contur and Object Perception': "From early childhood we are easily able to recognise a property of objects, usually associated with their surfaces, that we call color. No child, and relatively few adults, will doubt that color is on (or sometimes in) objects." [Boynton (1978), p. 175] In addition, one is aware of the different character of the way colors appear in different modes, i.e. for object surfaces such as apples, patches of light on screens, volumes such as wine , scattering media such as skies, light sources such as globes, and so on.
We may summarise these points by saying that colors are represented in visual experience as manifest, objective, intrinsic features of bodies in physical space. To say the feature is represented as manifest is to say that someone who is competent with colors, and who is taught color language, takes the property of color to be manifest and not hidden. These qualitative features are "sensuous" in the widest sense. This is not an issue of deep metaphysics. Many properties are not manifest: being poisonous, being made by a robot, containing water as a constituent, coming from Virginia, and so on. Someone who is taught color terms and who understands how they are used, knows what it is for something to be red, to be blue, or whatever: it is to have that feature which the perceiver is capable of recognising.
The term "sensuous" is often used on such a way as to apply to phenomenal, i.e. to ontological subjective qualities. However, there is a wider sense which does not have this commitment. There is a neutral use for the term. An illustration is an example which H.H.Price borrows from Husserl:
When I see a tomato hanging on a vine then a ripe tomato hanging on a vine is "leibhaft gegeben": it is given to me with its sensuous qualities. [Price (1932) p.231.]This sounds much better in German, of course, but in English the point is that the tomato (better still, grapes) and the vine are given in perception with the sensuous features. English speakers understand that in perceiving tomatoes, grapes, etc one is acquainted with sensuous features. Price was acknowledging that whatever one's theory of perception, and especially whether one thought that the perceiver were directly aware of physical objects or sensory presentations, one was acquainted with sensuous features.
It is the wider notion of "sensuous" that writers with very different philosophical commitments also employ. It is such a sense that Michael Tye, for example, appeals to, when he claims that physical objects have sensuous character, and that when philosophers appeal to the phenomenology of perceptual consciousness, in making claims about the sensuous, phenomenal character of experience, they are mistaking sensuous features of the content of experience for intrinsic features of experience itself. Tye considers a hypothetical appeal to first person phenomenology:
Standing on the beach in Santa Barbara a couple of summers ago on a bright sunny day, I found myself transfixed by the intense blue of the Pacific Ocean. Was I not here delighting in the phenomenal aspects of my visual experience? And if I was, doesn't this show that there are visual qualia?He is not convinced. It seems to him
that what I found so pleasing in the above instance, what I was focussing on as it were, were a certain shade and intensity of the color blue. I experienced blue as a property of the ocean not as a property of my experience. My experience itself certainly wasn't blue. Rather it was an experience that represented the ocean as blue. What I was really delighting in then were specific aspects of the content of my experience. It was the content, not anything else, that was immediately accessible to my consciousness and that has aspects I found so pleasing. [Tye (1992) p. 160]Writers as diverse as Price and Tye are in agreement. Moreover, they are right. There is a neutral sense of "sensuous", according to which it is possible for physical objects to have sensuous properties. Most importantly, the color properties that the natural concept of color attributes to physical objects are sensuous properties. It is of course a separate question of whether physical objects do have the sensuous features that they are represented as having. Price thinks that they do not. He is not alone.
Colors, we may conclude, are certain kinds of properties, ones that satisfy the following constraints:
No properties of physical objects stand, it has been said, in the right kinds or relations that are characteristic of the structured color arrays. It is true that we can arrange physical samples in ordered arrays but the ordering principles depend on the way they appear. What is crucial to the principle of ordering is the way the colors are represented as being, or rather, the character of the way colors are represented. It is because there is a distinctive appearance associated with each color that the colors are capable of being systematically ordered in the way that they are.
It would seem that, as far as our conceptual practices governing color are concerned, physical objects do not have the kinds of color they are represented as having. This result favours an illusion theory of color. The colors that objects are represented as having are illusory: no physical object actually has those colors. The colors might be said to be "virtual properties": they are properties objects do not have, but might have had: in some other possible world but not in this one. If we speak of colors as having essences, then they have virtual essences. Colors are virtual properties, just as phlogiston and caloric are virtual natural kinds.
The illusion theory, or virtual essence theory, of colors leaves us with a problem. If there are no properties that satisfy the requirements for being colors: how did the natural concept develop? The solution to this problem has already been given. The way that the concepts of color operate, to serve the functions and roles they possess, is through the way colors appear. For these purposes and roles, objects do not need the actual colors. It will be sufficient if they appear to have colors. For these purposes, it is sufficient that "it is as if they have the colors".
There are two major functions for color concepts. One reflects an epistemological purpose: colors are signs used to indicate the presence of objects of interest. The signs are either natural or conventional, the latter being ones designed for various social purposes. The purposes are equally well served even if objects do not have colors, but have the right appearances. All that is needed is that they are represented as having colors. The second major purpose of color concepts is aesthetic, understood in the widest sense. Color is significant in painting, decorating, clothing, theatre, make-up, advertising, showing off, sexual appeal and so on. Again, it matters not in the least that objects do not have these properties. All that is required is that they be represented as having them.
The significance of appearances is widespread. As we have seen, they provide the basis for the ordering principles governing color systems. Likewise, the causal truths and principles that employ color terms are ones connected with the way colors appear. For example, we can explain how there are such `truths' as "ripening pears (bananas, . . .) go from green to yellow". This is a truth. For a pear to be represented as green under the right conditions is a sign that the pair is not yet ripe; for it to be represented as yellow is a sign that it is ripe. In other words, whatever causal truths we have concerning color, can be explained by interpreting colors as signs or as indicators for other physical features, where those physical features serve the causal roles.
In a previous section a distinction was made between color science and the science of color. While the former field is flourishing there is little science of color. One way of understanding how this situation has arisen is that there are no actual colors in physical reality. What there are are experiences which represent objects as having colors, colors which in fact they do not have. That is, colors are virtual properties. Our visual experiences present us with systematic illusions. If this were the case, we would still have the same color science, exactly as we have now, for we would still need to know how colors are represented, and what causes them to be represented in the way that they are, and how the various conditions under which we have color experiences systematically differ can be explained. Since one of the central roles colors serve is to act as signs or indicators for physical objects, and any theory of color has to acknowledge this role anyway, it would seem that any fledgling science of color is best dispensed with in terms of other sciences, and color science left to the science of color perception. This does not stop it from being the case that there is an important theory of color vision and perception, and of the role colors play as signs or indicators.
Clearly, the concept of color can be used to serve many of its normal purposes even if the representations of color are illusory, providing that the illusions are systematic, which on a proper theory, of course, they will be.
It is doubtful that this manoeuvre works, for a number of reasons. One is that we would need to specify the criteria for determining an object's intrinsic redness. Not all perceivers agree in their judgements. It is not that there are color blind people who can, after all, be said to be color-deficient. There is a small but still significant number of color-anomalous people, who can make all the same color discriminations as regular people, but who disagree about which samples are pure red, green, etc. That is, it seems that their color solid is skewed from the normal. It seems arbitrary that we decide that the real color is the one that the majority pick. Secondly, if there were an evolutionary shift, or an eugenics progamme, the minority could become the majority.
There is a more important reason against Hacker's proposal, however. The major reason is that for colors, microstructural explanations cannot be provided for all the relevant, important features. Specifically the complex internal relationships between the colors cannot be explained by the microstructural properties of physical bodies, except through their affecting the perceivers. That is, to explain why the colors have the relationships they do requires giving an account of the structure of the perceiver's perceptual apparatus. At a minimum, this requires an account of the response curves of cells in the retinae, but also required would be an account of the appropriate neural processes. In short, the explanation will have to work via an explanation of how things appear, that is, how one's perceptual experiences have the content that they do.
There is a difference between solidity/liquidity and the colors. In the case of solidity and its sister concepts, there is a range of features that are associated with them, including causal relationships. If we have been given adequate scientific explanations at the microstructural level for solidity, then adequate microstructural explanations will need to be given for these other features. The reason why it is important to preserve the concepts of solidity and liquidity is that such concepts unify sets of properties that are useful to have unified, and which is lost if we retreat to the microstructural level.
The important difference with colors is that there are crucial features of colors that are not reproduced at the microstructural level of the physical objects, nor are they explained at that level. The features are those that colors have, by virtue of which they are capable of forming systems of properties with internal relationships. This structural property is not explained at the microstructural level of physical samples of colors. To try to explain the structure physically, the best we could hope to do is to try to explain it in terms of dispositions, e.g. to induce a certain ratio of light sensitive retinal cells. Even if that were to work, it is the wrong kind of explanation to help Hacker. He wants to hold that colors are intrinsic qualities of physical objects, not relational, dispositional ones.
There are two kinds of response an objectivist might make. One would be to deny the account of the natural concept of color as expounded here. Instead it might be argued, the way color terms operate in the language, it is understood that colors may well turn out to be hidden essences. On this account, the way colors appear is used as a criterion for detecting the presence of the hidden essence, but it is not essential to what it is for something to be colored. After all, gold is acknowledged as having both a hidden essence and an appearance: the real essence of gold, its atomic number, plays a causal role in producing a certain golden appearance, one that is used by language-users to identify, loosely, pieces of gold. In like manner, it is argued, colors have hidden essences which play a causal role in their having the appearances they do.
As an account of how color terms operate, this view is surely fantasy. It has the consequence that the appearance is not essential to color; that if colors were to cease to have their distinctive appearances that our color vocabulary would largely remain untouched. Our summary of the color-principles, however, revealed that all of these principles either directly involve color appearances or it was the case that the way they worked was through color appearances. Without appearances, colors would not be of any interest whatever. Just as wines would cease to have interest, even to dedicated wine-growers, were they to lose their distinctive tastes, so too would colors were they to lose their appearances.
There is, however, a second approach the objectivist can adopt: to concede that there are no colors in the way ordinarily conceived but nevertheless to hold that there are properly colors as conceived in another manner, in an objectivist manner. After all, there are not atoms as Dalton conceived them, nor oxygen as Lavoisier conceived it, nor planets as pre-Aristotelians conceived them, but still there are atoms, oxygen and planets, all the same. In other words, the objectivist can propose a revisionary concept of color as an objective property, e.g some microstructural property or a spectral reflectance or some other light-modifying feature.
The assessment of this proposal will depend on the nature of the revision recommended. It is one thing to propose the introduction of a new concept; it is another thing to propose it as a replacement for the existing concept in the spirit of eliminating it and other alternative revisions. There is no reason in principle why we should not introduce a new, different concept of color, "physical color" which, we may assume, takes over the causal role specified in our characterisation of color. Such a move is legitimate, but it leaves open the possibility that there is still a need for another concept, for the causal requirement was only one of the requirements for the original concept. If the new physical concept cannot service those other requirements, then we need another concept to serve these purposes. One possibility is that two new concepts should emerge. As Ian Hacking has pointed out, it is plausible that the original concept of "acid" later split into two new concepts, each perfectly legitimate. Another example is the replacement of Newtonian mass by the two new concepts of mass in relativity theory.
The important point, as far as colors are concerned, is that colored objects have characteristic appearances and that those appearances are of great interest to us. It is because we have that interest that we need a concept of dispositional color - the power to appear in characteristic ways. It is because of the way colors appear that they are important to us both biologically and socially. It is because colors have a characteristic appearance that: the colors can be ordered systematically in color arrays; they have emotional effects; principles of harmony and contrast apply; there are principles governing phenomena of color contrast. It is true that physical features both of physical objects and of retinal cells contribute causally to these phenomena, but central to all of these color principles is the way color appears.
There is an additional reason for requiring dispositional color. Physical surfaces, in the main, have distinctive ways of appearing, ways differing from those for volumes and films and light sources, and so on. Nevertheless they are all modes of appearing for color. What makes them all examples of color can only be understood in terms of them as appearances. The account that makes most sense of these modes of appearance is the dispositional account, one that unites these ways of appearing into dispositions to appear.
The major problem is to come up with plausible candidates for colors that will systematically tie in with the judgements of competent color observers. First of all, the causes of color appearances vary enormously, depending on whether we are considering opaque objects such as apples, rocks and tablecloths, as opposed to lights, wines, skies, films, rainbows, and so on. Second, even if we concentrate on the first type, surface color, we find that there is a wide variety of underlying physical microstructures, responsible for objects' appearing blue, yellow, etc. The causes of the colors objects appear to have are many and varied. The same type of micro-structure consistently appears the same color (within limits) under different conditions, but different microstructures may appear the same. It would seem that the proper physical candidate would have to be some light-related property, and a dispositional one, at that. The most plausible approach is to try to identify surface color with a light-modifying disposition, e.g. with a disposition to reflect (or absorb) certain proportions of standardised illumination, or, if one prefers, certain proportions of light of the wavelengths from the visible spectrum. Objects with neutral or achromatic colors are ones which reflect all wavelengths to (roughly) the same degree, with whites reflecting a higher percentage than greys and blacks. Objects with chromatic colors are those which differentially reflect or absorb light at different wavelengths. Accordingly color would be identified with some feature of an object's spectral reflectance curve.
There are major problems with finding candidates for objectivist analyses among light-related properties. The first is that, depending upon the type of object in question, a different candidate for each type has to be found. For physical surfaces, it would have to be related to the object's reflectance curve, e.g. the capacity to differentially reflect wavelengths from different regions of the incident illumination; in the case of volumes, it would be related to the objects transmittance, in the case of such objects as the sky, to the scatterance, and so on. In the case of aperture color or film color, it would be related to the pattern of light received at a particular place or at the source of the light (the reflecting source in the case of physical surfaces). Even in the case of ordinary objects, the colors may be caused in a variety of ways. The blue of a bird's coat may result from scatterance, the red in a different way.
Secondly, there is the problem of metamers. In the case of physical surfaces there are metamers, i.e objects with very different reflectance curves that have identical appearances of color. The situation is far more pronounced in the case of film colors or aperture colors. Here there are innumerable different combinations of light that will give the same hue. It would seem that the property shared by physical objects with the same film color is a disposition to incite the three light-sensitive cones in the retinae according to the same ratio: x: y: z.
There is an even more pressing difficulty that objectivist accounts face. In determining the right candidate for the objectivist account of color, our aim is not simply to show how color vision enables, say, the observer to distinguish objects with different spectral reflectance characteristics. Rather we need to explain why one reflectance profile deserves to be classified as blue, and likewise why other profiles are related to similar and differing colors. Given, as was argued above, that we have color science but not a science of color, the criteria for picking out one reflectance profile as unique green, say, have to relate to the way objects appear to observers. Consequently to identify one reflectance profile as that corresponding to unique green, we need to be able to specify standard conditions and normal observers. As Hardin has pointed out, most persuasively, this cannot be done except in a highly arbitrary way. Not only is there a minority of color perceivers who are anomalous (only slightly, but appreciably so) with respect to normal observers, but there is a considerable statistical spread even within the group of normal observers. The reflectance profile for unique green will differ for different members of the "normal group". One can decide, of course, on a standard and fix one reflectance profile as green, but the procedure is highly arbitrary. There is an alternative, however, and that is to tie color to appearance and, in consequence, relativise color to observers, with as much freedom or restriction, according to context, as is required.
An attempt to overcome what we might call "the problem of multiple realisations" has been provided by Frank Jackson (1996), who claims that each color can be identified with a physical property. Jackson concedes that there is no single physical feature that is the basis for each color say, blue, but maintains that this does not matter. Blue is identified with a different physical property on different occasions, depending on what kind of physical object has it. In principle there is no reason why there should not be a concept of physical color, in the way described by Jackson. It needs to be remembered, however, following the previous discussion, that the admissibility of such a concept would not mean that the dispositional concept ought to be eliminated. Jackson's concept of physical color would supplement the dispositional concept. However, given the problems associated with identifying normal observers and standard conditions, Jackson's account seems incapable of overcoming the difficulty posed by the arbitrariness of any objectivist selection of the particular reflectance profiles.
The objectivist is offering us a reconstruction of our original concept of color. If we are performing such a reconstruction, another possibility to consider is that the objectivist physical concept is unnecessary: it can be dispensed with in favour of a more fruitful concept. If we are to revise or replace the natural concept of color, there are several alternatives to conceptualising color as an intrinsic physical property. One is that color is a dispositional property: to call something "red" is to say that it has the power to appear red to observers of the appropriate kind. This dispositional concept, like the physical concept, is a recommendation. There is an even better proposal we could make, one that conceptualises color i terms of a mixed disposition:
x is red = x has some feature by virtue of which x appears red, . . .This concept has all the advantages of the physical concept, and added virtues of its own. It allows for multiple realisations of the disposition, and hence of the color. It does not require that for each color there is a unique physical basis. Second it allows for appearances to be essential to something's being colored. And finally, as well, it can perform the one function that the physical concept does very well: it shows how colors can have a causal role vis-a-vis the perception of color. The mixed dispositional concept retains the emphasis on red objects having the right kind of power, but it allows that the object, in having that power, has some physical feature (which may be different in different objects) which is the basis for that power. Clearly, on this analysis, the underlying physical feature has all the causal powers one could wish. The mixed dispositional analysis combines this with the advantage of keeping colors tied to the way they appear.
There are however, other models in science that we can employ, which do not involve identification or reduction, with or without replacement, where we still have the surface property explained in terms of the microstructural property. Take the example of "solidity". It is not at all clear that solidity has been reduced to, identified with or replaced by, any microstructural property, although it may well be true that it has been discovered what the microstructural causal basis of solidity is. To appreciate such models, let us consider what would be required for solidity to be reduced. If "solidity" has been reduced or replaced, we need to know what the original concept was. There is more than one candidate. For each of them, solidity is associated with certain kinds of causal powers: relative impenetrability, stability of a certain kind, capacities to resist, and so on. There are however, different kinds of relationship that solidity might have to these causal capacities:
2*. solidity = that microstructural basis whatever it is, which, as it happens, is the causal basis for the causal capacities and powers, as in 1.The difference is that, given 2*, the microstructural basis would remain solidity, should it, for some reason, cease to be the causal basis for those capacities, whereas given 2, it would not. On the latter account, it would cease to be solidity. Of course, if we have a stable world, such changes are unlikely to occur, and so in practice, it might not matter a great deal. There are situations, however, in which there might be a significant difference. It is possible in genetics, for example, that something might at one stage, be a gene for one characteristic, and at a later stage, because of changes elsewhere, be a gene for a different characteristic.
Has solidity been reduced or not? It is true that what it is about physical objects that makes them solids has been explained in terms of microstructures. This is true whether we have adopted models 1, 2, 2* or 3. Only on models 2 and 2*, however, has the property of solidity been identified with the microstructural property. On model 2, there is a special kind of identification, but it is an identification under a causal role. What it is for something to count as a solid requires it to fit that causal role.
The difference between 2* and the others is that on model 2* the causal powers specified are not essential to something's being a solid, whereas on the others, they are. It is true that over time, certain capacities might be thought less important, and others may need re-describing. Even so, this is compatible with saying that the old concept of solidity, for which certain casual powers are essential, evolves into, or gets replaced by, another concept of solidity for which other related powers are essential.
In the case at least of solidity, Model 2 seems more appropriate than Model 2*. It does not seem very obvious, however, why 2 should be preferable to 1 or 3. Model 3 has whatever virtues model 2 has, and besides it has a virtue that the latter lacks. If it turns out that there is no single microstructural basis that is the causal basis for the causal powers, then this eventuality is well handled on model 3. This model requires that there is some basis, not that there is a unique basis. Account 2 on the other hand, requires a unique property. The only possible way to handle the eventuality of multiple realisations is to say that there are different kinds of solidity each with its own unique basis. On this model, presumably, each kind of solidity is possessed by one of a limited range of objects. In the case of temperature it would seem that the physical basis must be different for gases, as against liquids, solids, and sub-atomic processes.
Multiple realisability of states such as temperature and solidity and potentially color, might be handled by a modification of model 2. It could be that in our reconstruction, we relativise the concept so that temperature is relativised to a range of objects, being that state which, for that range of objects, plays the distinctive causal role for that property. It is plausible to say, for example, that an eye is an eye for an organism of a certain kind. In each type of organism it plays a similar causal role, but it is realised by different structures in each type of organism. On this way of thinking, an eye for a spider is one thing, an eye for a human another, but what makes them both eyes is the kind of causal role to play. When we turn to colors, it is possible that we should treat colors in the same way: that color for surfaces is different from colors for volumes. But we need some principle to unite the various properties so that they each count as a color, and in particular cases, as the color red. The most plausible way to do this is to say that each physical property plays the causal role in producing a way of appearing, or in producing a representation of the same kind.
The lesson the example of solidity teaches us this. First, it is not clear that there has been reduction in the sense of identification with any microstructure, of the property of solidity, as specified by the old concept. It is possible that there could be an identification if we replace the old concept of solidity by a new one. However, that requires taking the new concept to be of a certain type, e.g. as in model 2, rather than as of a mixed type, as in model 3, and it is not at all clear that there is any reason for preferring the one revision over another.
Second, if it turns out that there are multiple realisations for solubility or temperature or whatever, the only kind of identification is a relativised one. Such a relativised identification is admissible, but it requires some uniting principle. In the case of solidity, the uniting principle seems to be that of having certain causal capacities and powers. What makes the relevant microstructural property count, in the proper contest, as solidity, is that it occupies a certain causal role. In the case of colors such a relativised account, one relativised to observers and the way they appear, would seem to be the most appropriate account. This means that one's relativised account of color has built into it an important reference to the way colors appear. In other words, the account supplements rather than replaces a dispositionalist account. The difference between color and solidity is that for color, appearances are essential, and for solidity, they are not.
On this account a distinction is drawn between physical color, the spectral reflectance possessed by physical bodies, and the kind of spectral reflectances that are associated with perceived color and color terms such as red, blue, yellow, etc. To be red, for example, is to have a reflectance that falls within a particular class. These classes, in general, are highly anthropocentric. The implication of this analysis is that colors are not only objective, but are anthropocentric, having few interesting causal powers, and being of little consequence, apart from how they connect with the peculiarities that underlie human color vision.
Hilbert defends his proposal by speaking of the identification of colors with spectral reflectance. Given the framework developed in this paper, this means that he has introduced a new concept of color "physical color" let us call it, which is different from the natural or folk concept. The folk concept `red' is identified with a kind containing several physical colors. Like other objectivist analyses, anthropocentric realism has a positive thesis and a negative one. The positive thesis is to the effect that there is a place for a new concept of color, "physical color". Indeed there is space for this concept and an anthropocentric concept. There is, however, a negative thesis: that the folk concept not only needs supplementing but should be eliminated. The reasons Hilbert gives seem to support the positive thesis, not the negative one. A dispositionalist can in fact embrace the new objectivist concept but say that the dispositional concept remains, for there is a need that it serves. And with the dispositional concept, the folk concept remains as well. As we have seen, the need is related to providing an account of the character of the three-dimensional color space.
In more detail this account is spelled out in the following way: "being colored a particular determinate color or shade is equivalent to having a particular spectral reflectance, illuminance, or emittance that looks that color to a particular perceiver in specific viewing conditions" [p.245]. Thompson insists that this account is to be distinguished from both a Lockean dispositionalist account and an illusion theory of colors. It is difficult to see, however, how he can maintain this stand. For one thing, he concedes that we see colors as perceiver-independent properties of things while maintaining that colors are perceiver-dependent properties. His answer to this difficulty, i.e. to why this is not a form of the illusion theory, is that on the ecological view it is not possible to perceive color as relational. That is, the relational nature of color does not allow the perceiver to perceive colors as relational. But this answer is not an answer to the question posed. What it explains is why one should not be surprised to find that, on the ecological view, that colors are experienced as perceiver-independent properties. But this is to admit that the way colors are represented in experience is not the way they are. The illusion theory denies that objects have the property (the color) they are represented as having. It need not deny that it is possible to formulate another concept of color that objects do satisfy. What it insists upon is that there is a need for the concept of color in the illusory sense.
To argue in this way for the place of a number of concepts of color, and for the possibility of an objectivist concept, to supplement other concepts of color, is to argue for a pluralist framework for colors. This framework has the advantage of allowing a place for an objective concept of color, while not making it mandatory. Whether or not there is any point in having an objective concept, there is, as we have seen, a need for a dispositional concept, one tied to the appearance of color. The dispositional concept is a crucial part of the pluralist framework.
But once we become enlightened by accepting the theory of virtual colors, how should we then think of the dispositional concept? What exactly does the exercise of the disposition consist in? What exactly is the content of the dispositional concept? The right answer is that there are two parts to the dispositionalist concept. One part refers to the way objects appear, and the other to the feature, whatever it is, which is the causal basis for the appearance. That is, the disposition is not pure but `mixed'. BlueD objects are objects that have some feature by virtue of which they look as if they are blue, i.e. blue in the intrinsic sense, i.e. blue in the virtual-color sense. To say that this sense of color is the virtual-color sense is not to say that colors are ordinarily conceived of as virtual. It is to say that the properties colors are conceived of as being are virtual. The content of the dispositional concept thus presupposes the virtual-color concept. This means that there is point in retaining this concept, even when we come to know that no objects have the property. The fact that I do not believe that this property of intrinsic blueness is ever instantiated does not mean that I should give up the concept, any more than disbelievers in Satan should give up the concept of satanic.
My use of the virtual-color concept to describe things requires me to adopt the naive attitude to color or, preferably, the engaged attitude typical of the playgoer who, at the theatre, suspends his belief that `it is all a pack of lies'. Of course as philosophers, we need to understand why we have this virtual-color concept and what role it plays, and for that I need to understand an account that makes reference to phenomenal colors. But none of that stops me from continuing to employ the virtual-color concept, whether as scientist, artist, consumer, town-planner, interior decorator or philosopher. As for serving functions such as being signs or as being aesthetically or emotionally significant, virtual colors are as good as real colors.
There is no need therefore to jettison the natural concept. Realising however that the color properties are virtual properties means that, for our understanding of how such a concept should apply and why it is so beneficial. Part of this understanding is provided by the explanation for why we have the natural concept that we do. The explanation for why the natural concept is beneficial is that the purposes served by the concepts are equally well served if objects merely appear to be colored and are not actually colored.
There is a further question: to explain how it is that the natural concept takes the form that it does, and in particular how it contains the basis for the structure that underpins the color systems for ordering colors. One of the characteristics of the color properties captured in the natural concept is that colors are the sorts of properties among which a set of internal relationships hold. That is, colors as a block, have a qualitative, sensuous character that enables objects having them to be systematically ordered and arranged. There are no physical features that have this character. One explanation for why this character is part of the virtual color property is that our sensory representations (or the elements/aspects in our visual experiences) have the qualitative character. It is because the sensory representations have the qualitative character that they do, that they represent physical objects as having the qualitative character in question.
The way that the phenomenal concept, i.e., the concept of color as a phenomenal property is introduced is that it serves to explain why the natural concept of color has the character that it does. When we have color experiences, typically we form sensory representations of the world. These representations represent objects in the physical world as having (virtual) colors, and they do so because the representations have the character implicit in three-dimensional color arrays. The representations do not have virtual colors (they have the right kind of structure, but they do not have the right causal powers), but they represent physical objects as having those colors. Sensory representations, in other words, have the phenomenological character that physical objects might have had but do not.
The qualitative character that the sensory representations have is sensory and phenomenal in the strongest sense. The character is ontologically subjective. In visual experience we experience the sensory color qualities as being in a public three dimensional space. That is, our experiences, and our sensory representations, represent the color qualities as being on the surfaces of physical objects, or as otherwise located in physical space. Contrary to what some philosophers believe, there is no more problem in experiencing phenomenal qualities in such a way than there is in feeling a pain in a foot or an elbow. In the case of pains, the phenomenal quality is felt on a bodily location, e.g. behind the eye, or in an elbow, etc. It needs to be said that although our sensory representations have phenomenal color qualities, which we are aware of, we are not aware of them as phenomenal qualities, that is, as phenomenal qualities of physical objects. We use the sensory representations as signs for physical objects, but we are not aware of the sign as a sign. It needs to be stressed that this account does not require colors, either phenomenal or virtual, to be projected into space. Just as they represent objects as having virtual colors, so they represent objects as having spatial properties (and relations) through themselves having phenomenal spatial properties.
Supposing that colors, as we normally think of them, are virtual properties, how, if at all, should we adjust our ideas in thinking of colors? If normally our perception of color involves `false consciousness', what is the right way to think of colors? The answer to that is that for many purposes we should think of them in the same way as we always did. In the case of color, unlike other cases, false consciousness should be a cause for celebration.
For some purposes, however, we need to develop a more comprehensive account, a pluralist account of color. The different elements of the virtual concept of color reflect different functions that this concept is meant to play. Given these different functions and the fact that there is no property that satisfies all of them, it is open to us to develop a pluralist account of color in which different concepts of color take over different functions. This pluralist account allows for the possibility of an objectivist concept of color, but it requires a dispositionalist concept, a virtual color concept and arguably, with the latter, a phenomenal concept.
First published: December 1, 1997 Content last modified: December 1, 1997