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Used more broadly and more loosely, the term "ancient skepticism" is sometimes used to refer to a great many other schools and thinkers (among them, Cynicism, Cyrenaicism, Sophism, Gorgias, Protagoras, Socrates, Diogenes of Sinope and others) which are characterized by significant sceptical inclinations.
It is the narrow notion of "ancient skepticism" which is emphasized in this article, though the broader influences that inform are discussed. The article ends with a discussion of the significance and relevance of ancient skepticism in the context of modern and contemporary philosophy.
When people are investigating any subject, the likely result is either a discovery, or a denial of discovery and a confession of inapprehensibility, or else a continuation of the investigation. This, no doubt, is why in the case of philosophical investigations, too, some have said that they have discovered the truth, some have asserted that it cannot be apprehended, and others are still investigating.One might question two aspects of these remarks. Taken in the context of what we know of ancient skepticism (and Sextus' own extant writings) it is difficult to accept the suggestion that the sceptics merely "investigate" the possibility of establishing truth. While it is important for the sceptics to admit (on pain of inconsistency) that they themselves may ultimately be mistaken, their stance is clearly a negative one which functions as a profound critique of any attempt (and any possible attempt) to build a basis for claims to truth. The prodigious collection of arguments that Sextus and other sceptics amass in this regard leave no room for any suggestion that the sceptics are neutral on this point.Those who are called Dogmatists in the proper sense of the word think that they have discovered the truth -- for example the schools of Aristotle and Epicurus and the Stoics and some others. The schools of Clitomachus and Carneades, and other Academics, have asserted that things cannot be apprehended. And the Sceptics [the skeptikoi] are still investigating. (PH 1.1-3, Annas & Barnes)
Sextus' thumbnail sketch of Carneades, Clitomachus and other Academic sceptics is also controversial. One might easily argue that they embrace a full fledged skepticism, and that he is artificially attempting to drive a wedge between Pyrrhonism and competing schools of skepticism. In the present context, the important point is that we may classify these schools as scepticis even if they do adopt the negative dogmatism which he ascribes them, for their philosophy remains a concerted and comprehensive attack on our ability to establish what is true.
While these aspects of Sextus might be questioned, he still usefully points out that a comprehensive commitment to the uncertainty of claims to truth is the heart of ancient skepticism. Within the schools of ancient skepticism, this usually manifests itself in the claim that we should suspend judgment on the truth of any claim. But ancient skepticism is something more than the suspension of judgment -- epoche -- and something more than a commitment to sceptical conclusions. At the very least, it is epoche and skepticism propounded on the basis of a standard way of arguing. Though the particulars differ in the case of different sceptics, it may generally be said that ancient skepticism casts doubt on the reliability of any claim, argument, appearance, impression, etc. by opposing it with a contrary claim, argument, appearance, impression, etc. Sextus describes this method of antithesis when he explains later Pyrrhonism's commitment to the suspension of judgment:
Broadly speaking, this [suspension of judgement about everything] comes about because of the setting of things in opposition. We oppose either appearances to appearances, or ideas to ideas, or appearances to ideas. We oppose appearances to appearances when we say `The same tower seems round from a distance but square from near by.' We oppose ideas to ideas when someone establishes the existence of providence from the orderliness of the things in the heavens and we oppose to this the frequency with which the good fare badly and the bad prosper, thereby deducing the non-existence of providence. We oppose ideas to appearances in the way in which Anaxagoras opposed to snow's being white the consideration: snow is water, and water is black, therefore snow is black too. On a different scheme, we oppose sometimes present things to present things, but sometimes present things to past and future things... (PH 1.31-5, Long & Sedley)In view of the sceptics' emphasis on opposition and antithesis, ancient skepticism to a great extent functions as an enormous catalogue of arguments which can be invoked in order to oppose any point of view. Especially in Sextus, the catalogue frequently seems a grab bag which freely mixes the compelling with the peculiar, the weak with the strong, and the outlandish with issues which remain of fundamental philosophical significance. Though many of the arguments are only of antiquarian interest, many others remain, thousands of years later, the subject of extended discussion and debate. Taken as a whole, there can be no doubt that ancient skepticism raises profound epistemological issues which are likely to remain a perennial philosophical concern.
The ancient sceptics' method of promoting skepticism through antithesis is clearest in Pyrrhonism but it is also evident in Academic skepticism. Diogenes Laertius associates it with Arcesilaus when he writes that "He was the originator of the Middle Academy, being the first to suspend his assertions owing to the contrarieties of arguments. He was also the first to argue pro and contra, and the first to change traditional Platonic discourse and, by question and answer, to make it more of a debating contest" (4.28-44, Long & Sedley). In Arcesilaus and Carneades, the method of antithesis is evident in their famous arguments against the Stoic claim that "cataleptic" impressions are a guide to truth, which oppose purported examples of such impressions with equally convincing impressions which are nonetheless mistaken. Antithesis is also highlighted in Carneades' famous trip to Rome, where he is said to have on one day argued eloquently for justive and on the next to have argued with equal force against it (reported in Lactantius, The Divine Institutions, 5.16, 6.6). Judging by Cicero's account in De Finibus, the discussion method the Academic sceptics used in the Academy was itself a version of antithesis, for it proceeds by having a student propound a claim (e.g., "The Chief Good in my opinion is pleasure") which is then opposed, either through a process of question and answer, or by propounding a lengthy discourse that leads to the opposite conclusion.
Ancient skepticism's rejection of our ability to establish truth, founded on a very general commitment to antithesis, may seem peculiar when considered from the point of view of modern and contemporary philosophy, but it is eminently understandable when it is considered within its own historical context. For though Pyrrhonism and Academic skepticism are unique philosophies which represent a radical extension of implicit and explicit doubts one finds elsewhere, it is also true that they very much reflect their times, and can be easily understood as both an extension of and a reaction against other prominent trends in ancient thought. It is in view of this that something should be said about the historical context which produces ancient skepticism.
At first glance, the sceptics' conviction that we are unable to determine what is true may seem diametrically at odds with other ancient philosophies which maintain that truth is enshrined in a particular philosophical perspective -- in Democritus' (or Epicurus') commitment to atoms, in Parmenides' world of being, in Heracleitan flux, and so on. While this is an important difference, it is easy to exaggerate its signficance. For though the sceptics do vehemently reject the conclusions of the "dogmatic" philosophers, the considerations that lead them to sceptical conclusions have very significant affinities to the views of their philosophical opponents. Particularly notable is a common interest in opposition, antithesis, and the issues raised by the apparent prevalence (both in philosophy and ordinary life) of opposing points of view. One might, for example, easily compare the sceptics' commitment to antithesis to the sophist conviction that one can argue convincingly on either side of any question. Protagoras' difficult conclusion that opposing (and to us contradictory) points of view are true is one obvious extension of this point of view. It is committed to truth in a way that is antithetical to ancient skepticism, but both philosophies are still founded on a similar commitment to the ability to create opposition and antithesis.
One might say the same in many other cases. Philosophically, this is to be expected, for philosophers who are faced with convincing views and arguments which oppose one another may plausibly conclude that the opposing perspectives are true, that ultimate reality is found in a realm that in some way transcends must such opposition, or that one cannot establish which of opposing views are true. It is in these three general categories that one can place the views of philosophers like Heracleitus, Protagoras, Plato, Democritus and the sceptics. Looked at from this point of view, ancient skepticism has impressive ties to other ancient philosophies which make much of opposition and opposing points of view.
The affinities to skepticism that exist in non-sceptical ancient philosophies are also evident in philosophies which incline, in one way or another, toward sceptical conclusions. There are, for example, significant parallels to skepticism in the views of thinkers like Xenophanes (who concludes that no one can know clear truth), Democritus (who holds that "bastard" knowledge gained through our senses exists only by convention), Diogenes of Sinope (whose Cynicism dismisses abstruse philosophical speculation), and even Aristotle in the case of his commitment to rhetoric (which recognizes the possibility of arguing convincingly for conflicting points of view). These are notable affinities even though the conclusions of such philosophers reject the ancient sceptical view that we cannot know the truth of any claim.
The sceptics' commitment to antithesis also highlights the extent to which their philosophy is tied to more general features of ancient thought which frequently distinguish it from its modern and contemporary counterparts. It is in this regard significant that the ancient sceptics operate in an intellectual milieu in which science does not boast the practical and theoretical successes that we take for granted; in which a bewildering array of opposing philosophical perspectives characterize philosophical inquiry; in which important philosophers propound dazzling arguments for the most paradoxical conclusions (that motion is impossible, that nothing exists, that time is an illusion, etc.); in which an interest in other cultures highlights opposing customs and traditions; in which mysticism and irrationalism are powerful cultural forces; and in which opposing social forces and perspectives are highlighted by war, political rivalry and a religion and a mythology which pit god against god, man against man and even god against man (thereby demonstrating opposing interests and perspectives). Looked at from this point of view, it is not at all surprising that ancient skepticism enjoyed significant success and influence.
Though Pyrrho left no writings, we come close to him in a fragment of Aristocles preserved in Eusebius' Preparation for the Gospel. It includes a summary of Pyrrho's views given by Pyrrho's most illustrious student, Timon.
He [Pyrrho] himself has left nothing in writing, but this pupil Timon says that whoever wants to be happy must consider these three questions: first, how are things by nature? Secondly, what attitude should we adopt towards them? Thirdly, what will be the outcome for those who have such an attitude? According to Timon, Pyrrho declared that things are equally indifferent, unmeasurable and inarbitrable. For this reason neither our sensations nor our opinions tell us truths or falsehoods. Therefore for this reason we should not put our trust in them one bit, but should be unopinionated, uncommitted and unwavering, saying concerning each individual thing that it no more is than is not, or both is and is not, or neither is nor is not. The outcome for those who actually adopt this attitude, says Timon, will be first speechlessness [aphasia], and then freedom from disturbance; and Aenesidemus says pleasure. (14.18.2-5, Long & Sedley, slightly amended)According to Timon in his Pytho, the formula Pyrrho here suggests as a way to express one's lack of opinions -- ou mallon ("no more is than is not") -- signifies a decision to determine nothing and suspend judgment (D.L. 9.76). The practical aim of Pyrrho's skepticism is seen in his suggestion that its goal is "freedom from disturbance." By all accounts, he was tremendously successful in achieving this end, Timon writing elsewhere that "This, Pyrrho, this my heart is fain to know; Whence peace of mind to thee doth freely flow; Why among men thou like a god dost show?" (D.L. 9.65, Hicks)
In keeping with this, Pyrrho is known, first and foremost, as a moral figure who is famous for his composure, his asceticism, and his honourable way of life. A much later Life of Pyrrho is found in Diogenes Laertius' Lives of Eminent Philosophers. Among other things, it tells us that Pyrrho went off and lived like a recluse; did "not so much as frown" when treated with disinfectants, surgery and cautery; voluntarily adopted a life of piety and poverty; performed menial tasks to show his indifference; and was confronted when he failed to retain his composure on an occasion in which a cur rushed at him and terrified him (Pyrrho answered that it is difficult to strip oneself of human nature). The positive impression Pyrrho made on the citizens of Elis is reflected in the story that they made him a high priest and on his account passed a law that philosophers should be exempt from taxes (D.L. 9.64). Pausanias reports a stature erected in his honour (6.24.5).
Flintoff has located the origins of Pyrrho's indifference in his travels to India in the company of Alexander the Great, where he was exposed to Indian philosophy, asceticism and a commitment to an enlightened state of mind. There are notable affinities and Pyrrho appears to have been impressed by India's "Naked Philosophers" (the gymno-sophists) but there is little reason to think that they did more than reinforce Democritean influences which are the prime force in Pyrrho's philosophical development. It is in this regard significant that the latter easily account for his brand of moral asceticism, that Pyrrho's teacher was the Democritean Anaxarchus (whom he accompanied to India), that Pyrrho's formula ou mallon originates in Democritean philosophy (see DeLacy), and that Pyrrho is said to have admired Democritus above all others (D.L. 9.67).
We can better understand Pyrrho's skepticism by distinguishing an epistemological and a moral element. The former is a rejection of the attempt to establish what is true which is a natural extension of Democritus' skepticism about ordinary opinions (which rejects ordinary opinions and their contradictions, arguing that truth resides in atoms and the void). Pyrrho goes one step further and rejects all scientific and intellectual inquiry (D.L. 9.69,65; cf. PH 1.28-29; AM 11.1). As Aristocles puts it, "if we are so constituted that we know nothing, then there is no need to continue enquiry into other things. Among the ancients too there have been people who made this pronouncement... Pyrrho of Elis was ... a powerful spokesman of such a position" (Eusebius, 14.18.1-2, Long & Sedley). According to this account, Pyrrhonism functions like a broom which sweeps away intellectual inquiry (or, to use an analogy found in Sextus, as a laxative which purges us of opinions and the attempt to establish them). In its wake, we may replace speculative philosophy with the practical moral goals which culminate in Pyrrho's famous equanimity. To this extent, early Pyrrhonism is anti-intellectual, much as Cynicism's disdain for theory emphasizes practical moral accomplishments rather than theoretical philosophical concerns.
The moral side of Pyrrho's practical philosophy is centred on the goal of peace of mind achieved through an attitude of indifference. Here too one finds clear Democritean roots for Pyrrho's point of view. They are in particular highlighted in the following fragment of Democritus, which suggests a method for establishing equanimity which is explicitly founded on comparison and a commitment to the relativity of value.
[In order to achieve cheerfulness]... one must keep one's mind on what is attainable, and be content with what one has, paying little heed to things envied and admired, and not dwelling on them in one's mind. Rather must you consider the lives of those in distress, reflecting on their intense sufferings, in order that your own possessions and condition may seem great and enviable, and you may, by ceasing to desire more, cease to suffer in your soul... One must... [compare] one's own life with that of those in worse cases, and must consider oneself fortunate, reflecting on their sufferings, on being so much better off than they. If you keep to this way of thinking, you will live more serenely. (fr. 191, cf. fr. 3; Kirk, Raven and Schofield)
The comparisons between our own situation and that of others which Democritus here proposes imply a method of antithesis which can be used to achieve and sustain a tranquil state of mind. It operates by opposing thoughts that disturb us -- thoughts that we are unfortunate, badly done by, etc. -- with the sufferings of those worse off. The comparisons this produces suggest that we are mistaken when we believe that we are unfortunate and not badly off (as the old saw goes, "I was upset about my lack of shoes until I met a man with no feet"). Fortified by a universal skepticism which allows him to oppose any point of view, Pyrrho apparently generalizes this method, using sceptical antithesis for practical moral ends.
Though later Pyrrhonism seems characterized by a waning of the ascetic extremism attributed to Pyrrho, the principles of this approach are still evident in Sextus, who explains that skepticism brings with it peace of mind (ataraxia).
For the man who opines that anything is by nature good or bad is forever being disquieted: when he is without the things which he deems good he believes himself to be tormented by things naturally bad and he pursues after the things which are, as he thinks, good; which when he has obtained he keeps falling into still more perturbations because of his irrational and immoderate elation, and in his dread of a change of fortune he uses every endeavour to avoid losing the things which he deems good. On the other hand, the man who determines nothing as to what is naturally good or bad neither shuns nor pursues anything eagerly; and, in consequence, he is unperturbed. (PH 1.27-28, Bury)
In the case of Pyrrho, skepticism and "unperturbedness" are notably associated with his teacher, Anaxarchus. Galen classifies him as a sceptic (fr. 15) and Sextus says he likened "existing things to a scene-painting," supposing them "to resemble the impressions experienced in sleep or madness" (AM 7.87-8, Bury). Significantly, he is known as "the happy one" (eudaimonikos) in view of his composure and is said be unflappable even when he dies a horrible death at the hands of the tyrant Nicocreon (the incident is most unlikely but probably founded on a real commitment to Democritean equanimity). It is intriguing to find him establishing equanimity through antithesis on a famous occasion in which he cures King Alexander's despondency after the king kills a friend in anger (Plutarch, Alexander LII).
We know virtually nothing about the details of Pyrrho's own arguments, though the Democritean method of equanimity through comparison seems implicit in the report that he marvelled at Homer and would often quote the lines: "Ay friend, die thou; why thus thy fate deplore? Patrocles, thy better, is no more" (21.106-7, Hicks). Upset at one's fate is here opposed by the thought that Patrocles, one's better, has suffered the same fate. It is this process of establishing equanimity through sceptical opposition which is probably implied when Pyrrho is said to have "talked to himself" in order to train to be good (D.L., 9.63, 64, cf. 9.69).
A similar issue arises in the context of the Pyrrhoneans practical affairs, for how can Pyrrho and his followers survive the pitfalls of day to day life -- much less achieve supreme contentment -- if they refuse to believe the truth of their sense impressions? The calamity that must befall anyone with such an attitude is often said to be reflected in the ancient story that Pyrrho accepted skepticism "in his actual way of life, avoiding nothing and taking no precautions, facing everything as it came, wagons, precipices, dogs, and entrusting nothing whatsoever to his sensations. But he was looked after... by his disciples, who accompanied him" (D.L. 9.62, Long & Sedley).
While there are legitimate questions to be raised about Pyrrho's philosophy, the latter anecdotes do not deserve the attention they have frequently received. Usually they are attributed to Antigonus of Carystus (who is in any case an unimpressive source), but the reference in Laertius is more vague, attributing them to "those around" him. This makes them little more than rumours. Their tenuousness is evident in the fact that they are contradicted by most of the other anecdotes Laertius appears to have taken from Antigonus -- anecdotes which report Pyrrho operating with his senses and absent of the followers alleged to keep him from harm (the same can be said of the anecdote in Aristocles). Very little can be made of the fact that Diogenes reports such rumours, as he is very unreliable and as concerned with entertainment as with scholarship. As Hicks says in his introduction to the Lives, "His account of Plato... clearly shows how superficial and unreliable he was" (xvii) and "Diogenes is a veritable tissue of quotations from all sorts of authors and on most conceivable, and some inconceivable, aspects of philosophers' lives.... Much of this quoted material is trivial, merely amusing, or probably false..." (xix). Laertius' willingness to countenance any strange story is evident in his lack of skepticism when he relates reports that Pythagoras descended into Hades and saw the tortured souls of Hesiod and Homer (8.20); that Apollo apeared to Plato's father when his mother was carrying him (3.1); that both Anaxarchus and Zeno of Elea bit off their tongues and spat them at tyrants that were persecuting them (9.27,59); and so on.
One might contrast the implausibility of the suggestion that Pyrrho rejected his senses with Posidonius' account of his actions (D.L. 9.68) when he was caught in a wild storm at sea. Confronted with other passengers who were wailing and cringing with horror, he remained calm and pointed to a small pig which was standing on the deck ignoring the storm as it ate, saying that its attitude demonstrated the unperturbed state of the wise man. As Hallie and Morrison point out, this suggests that it is not sense perceptions, but human fears and frailties which Pyrrho wants to expunge by sceptical inquiry. Such a goal is very much in keeping with the spirit of Pyrrho's philosophy, its Democritean roots, and the high regard for Pyrrho which seems to characterize those who associated with him.
One may still ask how Pyrrho's professed skepticism allows him to consistently embrace his senses and his avowed sceptical conclusions. The evidence that we have tells us that his student Timon answers that the Pyrrhonian guides his life by "appearances" (phainomena -- roughly what appears to be the case). So understood, early Pyrrhonism distinguishes claims to truth (which are rejected) and an allegedly weaker acceptance of what appears to be the case (an acceptance which functions as a guide to life). Looked at from this point of view, it is not apperances but the question how they should be explained (as true, false, reliable, veridical, illusory, the result of atoms, etc.) which is the focus of Pyrrhonean skepticism. As one reads in Diogenes Laertius:
...the dogmatists say that they [the sceptics] abolish life, in the sense that they throw out everything that goes to make up a life. But the sceptics say that these charges are false. For they do not abolish, say, sight, but only hold that we are ignorant of its explanation.... We do sense that fire burns, but we suspend judgement as to whether it is fire's nature to burn. Further, we do see that someone is moving, that someone perishes; but as for how these things occur, we do not know. "We only object," they say, "to the non-evident things added on to the phenomena [the appearances]. For when we say that a picture has raised surfaces we are elucidating what is apparent; when we say that it does not have them, we are no longer speaking about what appears, but something else." For this reason, Timon in his Pytho says that he has not diverged from what is customary. And in his Likenesses he says, "But the apparent utterly dominates wherever it goes." And in his work On the Senses he says, "That honey is sweet I do not posit; that it appears so I concede." (D.L. 9.104-5, Inwood & Gerson)The early Pyrrhoneans thus propose a commitment to appearances as a basis for their commitment to skepticism and the mundane realities of daily life. They claim only that skepticism, for example, appears correct, and only that the impressions they rely on appear. The plausibility and consistency of such a view must therefore be decided by debating this position. Many authors (in recent literature, most notably Frede and Burnyeat) have reached contrary conclusions in this regard. The present article considers the issue in its concluding section.
The first of the Academic sceptics is Arcesilaus, the head of the "Middle" or "Second" Academy. He is said to have been influenced by Plato, Pyrrho and Diodorus Cronus (a clever dialectician of considerable skill). Ariston is said to describe him as "Plato in front, Pyrrho behind, Diodorus in the middle" (D.L. 4.33). Diogenes Laertius, Sextus, Cicero and Plutarch all credit him with introducing skepticism and the suspension of judgment into the Academy (D.L. 4.28,32; PH 1.232; Ac., 1.43-5; Adv. Col. 1120e). According to Sextus, Arcesiluas' position is "virtually identical" with the views of the Pyrrhoneans (PH 1.232).
Though it is clear that Arcesilaus was no ascetic (see D.L. 4.37-42) and in this sense differs from Pyrrho, he also appears to see skepticism as a practical philosophy which is tied up with practical moral aims. He therefore holds that skepticism aims at happiness (AM 7.158) and some of the anecdotes we find in Plutarch suggest that he, like Pyrrho, is capable of opposing unhappiness and establishing equanimity by proposing different ways of looking at a particular situation (see "On the control of anger," 461E and "On Tranquillity of Mind," 470A-B). Such incidents are not necessarily inspired by Pyrrho, however, as they reflect common Hellenistic ideals.
Arcesilaus arguments for skepticism are in particular concerned to show that his Stoic rivals fail to provide an epistemology that can justify claim to knowledge. Couissin has popularized the notion that Arcesilaus is a dialectician who defends skepticism, not because he endorses it, but merely as a reductio ad absurdum of the Stoic point of view. It is difficult (perhaps impossible) to judge Arcesilaus' intentions almost 2000 years later, and it is in any case never easy to tell how a philosopher intends a particular argument or position (Caton argues that Descartes is not committed to the cogito in the Meditations) but it must still be said that it is difficult to get around the fact that this intepretation contradicts our best ancient sources and imposes on Arcesilaus a purely negative philosophy which is philosophically unsatisfying.
The crux of Arcesilaus' attack on Stoic epistemology is his critique of their account of the "cataleptic" impression (the kataleptike phantasia) which is a clear and distinct (and hence forceful) impression which is said to reveal certain truth. Arcesilaus argues that there is no such impression, and no guarantee of truth, for the form of any alleged cataleptic impression can be found in a similar impression which is known to be mistaken (Ac., 2.77; AM 7.252). If I propose my impression that there is a desk in front of me as cataleptic, then Arcesilaus and his school will oppose to it similarly vivid impressions (experienced when dreaming, hallucinating, etc.) which are said to demonstrate that its form and nature are no guarantee of truth. In the process they formulate an argument for skepticism which is comparable to important modern arguments.
According to Sextus, Arcesilaus combines his arguments against our ability to establish truth with a commitment to "the reasonable" (the eulogon) which he propounds as a (non-dogmatic) practical criterion which can provide the necessary grounds for positive action in day to day affairs.
...since it was necessary... to inquire into the conduct of life which naturally cannot be directed without a criterion, upon which happiness too, that is, the goal of life depends for its reliability, Arcesilaus says that he who suspends judgment about everything regulates choices and avoidances and, generally, actions by reasonableness, and, proceeding according to this criterion, will act correctly. For happiness arises because of prudence, and prudence resides in correct actions, and a correct action is that which, having been done, has a reasonable defence. Therefore, he who adheres to reasonableness will act correctly and will be happy. (AM 7.158, Inwood & Gerson)Though those who see Arcesilaus as a negative dialectician hold that Arcesilaus does not actually endorse the views suggested here, Sextus straightforwardly claims he does and some such commitment is necessary if Arcesilaus is to have a complete philosophy which can provide a basis both for day to day affairs, and for his commitment to the sceptical point of view (on this point, cf. Hankinson, 86-91).
It goes without saying that Arcesilaus' apparent endorsement of the "reasonable" leaves open the question whether it is, in the final analysis, consistent with his skepticism. Leaving this issue for later, it is worth noting that this was a heated issue already in ancient times, as can be seen from Plutarch's work Against Colotes. It takes the Epicurean to task for his attack on other philosophers in a book entitled On the fact that the doctrines of the other philosophers make it impossible to read . Lest too much be made of the Colotes' attack on Arcesilaus, it should be said that he also attacks Democritus, Aristotle, Parmenides, Socrates and virtually everyone but his mentor, Epicurus. The angry and dismissive tone of Plutarch's reply is seen in his claim that the details of Arcesilaus' views get from Colotes the kind of response that a performance on the lyre gets from an ass.
Like Arcesilaus, Carneades directs his sceptical opposition primarily, but not only, against the Stoics. He is said to have become so famous attacking the arguments of Chrysippus that he quipped that "if Chrysippus had not existed neither would I" (D.L. 4.62, this is a take off on the Stoic maxim: "if Chrysippus had not existed, neither would the Stoa"). A detailed account of Carneades' extent arguments is beyond the scope of the present article, but it is worth noting that they appear to be remarkably varied; that they cite conflicting philosophical opinions; that they reject the knowability of the ultimate good (the summum bonum); that they rebut a great many theological arguments; that they make the case for and against justice; that they take issue with Stoic determinism; and that they attack the possibility of establishing a criterion for distinguishing between truth and falsity.
One finds a useful account of some of Carneades' most important arguments in Sextus' work, "Against the Logicians" (AM 1.159-165). According to this account, they are addressed against all of his predecessors, not merely the Stoics. The first argument Sextus mentions maintains that there can be no guide to truth -- not reason, the senses, nor anything else -- for all of them can mislead us. The second argument notes that the impressions (or "presentations") that inform our judgments are a problematic basis for claims to (objective) truth, for they reflect their own nature as well as the nature of the world beyond them -- as light shows both itself and the things within it. They are, in other words, inherently subjective in the sense in which what we see reflects the nature of our sense of sight, not merely the nature of the world beyond it. Judging by Sextus, Carneades underscores the subjectivity of our impressions with the standard Academic argument that any apparently true impression can be paired with (and opposed by) a similar impression which is false.
Though the kind of ascetic equanimity which characterizes Pyrrho does not appear to be a central aspect of his views, Carneades is capable of practising `opposition for the sake of equanimity.' Cicero implicitly attributes him the Democritean method of comparison when he says that Carneades criticizes Chrysippus for his approval of a passage where Euripides recounts the pain of life, saying that his endorsement promotes depression whereas the passage should be used to bring comfort to the ill-disposed by reciting others misfortunes (Tus Dis 3.59-60). According to Plutarch, Carneades also held that we should oppose the expected with the unexpected (our likely safety with the possibility of accident, our likely health with the possibility of sickness, etc.) because the latter causes grief when it catches us off our guard (Tranq 474F-75A). Carneades illustrates how arguments can nurture equanimity in a famous speech in which he argued that the wise man will not be distressed at the fall of his own country -- a speech given for the sake of Clitomachus when he had to bear the destruction of his native city of Carthage (Tus Dis 3.54).
It must nonetheless be said that there are good theoretical reasons why Carneades cannot embrace the strong conception of equanimity that characterizes a sceptic like Pyrrho. To understand why we need to first understand the sceptical conception of assent and belief which he suggests (the extent to which he endorses it is a matter of scholarly controversy which is discussed in the next section of this article). According to Eusebius, he claimed that it was impossible for a man to suspend judgment on all matters, and to have distinguished between things that are "non-evident" (non-apparent) and "non-apprehensible," and to have held that everything is non-apprehensible but not non-evident (Prep. Ev. 14.7.15). One might easily compare the Pyrrhonean commitment to appearances, but Carneades goes further and develops a sophisticated account of the belief that this implies by distinguishing between impressions which are more or less (subjectively) plausible or persuasive (see AM, 7.169).
Sextus' account suggests that Carneades distinguishes four levels of plausibility (the pithanon) by distinguishing between impressions which are:
Sextus illustrates Carneades levels of plausibility with a famous example:
On seeing a coil of rope in an unlighted room a man jumps over it, conceiving it for the moment to be a snake [i.e. judging this to be plausible], but turning back afterwards he inquires into the truth, and on finding it motionless he is already inclined to think that it is not a snake [for this impression seems reversible], but as he reckons, all the same, that snakes too are motionless at times when numbed by sinter's frost, he prods at the coiled mass with a stick, and then, after thus testing the impression received, he assents to the fact that it is false so supposes that the body presented to him is a snake [and that his initial impression is implausible]. (AM, 7.187-88)
It is important to emphasize that Carneades' levels of plausibility are not proposed as a means for judging which impressions are and are not true. As we read in a passage of Clitomachus preserved in Cicero: "The Academic school holds that there are dissimilarities between things of such a nature that some of them seem plausible and others the contrary; but this is not an adequate ground for saying that some things can be perceived [as true] and others cannot, because many false objects are plausible..." (Ac 2.103, Rackham, slightly amended). This does not mean that the Academic sceptic cannot use plausibility as a basis for belief, but it does mean that he attempts to accept the beliefs that he accepts with only qualified assent -- i.e. accepted as a basis for action without the claim that they are objectively true (see Ac 2.104). It is in keeping with this that Sextus emphasizes that Carneades' plausibility is only a subjective measure which judges an impression in regard to the subject experiencing the belief, rather than the objective reality beyond them (AM, 7.169).
Despite Carneades' apparent attempt to make his account of the plausible compatible with his skepticism by proposing it as a subjective measure, there remains a fundamental difference that separates his skepticism from Pyrrhonism in the moral sphere. Thus the Pyrrhoneans attempt to adopt as detached an attitude as possible -- an attitude characterized by the minimum inclination possible. This is what allows them to propose skepticism as a basis for mental equanimity. In contrast, Carneades' pithanon allows, despite its subjective nature, different levels of attachment. A (merely) plausible and a tested impression may, for example, both be given qualified assent, but in accepting the tested impression as tested one assigns it a higher level of plausibility and commitment. As Sextus puts it, "the word `believe' has two different meanings: it means not to resist but to simply follow without strong inclination or commitment...; but sometimes it means to assent to a thing out of choice and with what amounts to sympathy due to strong desire.... Since therefore Carneades and Clitomachus say that they are persuaded and take something to be plausible with a strong inclination, while we say we simply yield without commitment, we differ in this respect." (PH 1.230).
Looked at from our point of view, the difference between Carneades and Pyrrhonism which Sextus mentions may favour Carneades rather than Pyrrho. Regardless of what one says in this regard, Carneades' skepticism is a strikingly modern attempt to establish sophisticated standards for belief which is defined as subjective in deference to sceptical considerations and which emphasizes criteria of coherence and verification.
This issue is a thorny one, as the difference between the two interpretations of Carneades is not as obvious as it may at first appear. Any philosopher is likely to act as a dialectician at some time or other, for considering hypothetical positions and using them to argue against others is an integral part of philosophical exchange. This is even more so in the case of ancient skepticism, for the ancient sceptic holds that it is possible to oppose any point of view "for the sake of argument" and continually does so without subscribing to the conclusions he employs. Dialectical arguments therefore play an enormous roll in skepticism and sceptics are easily confused with dialecticians. If we had lost only a few pages at the beginning of the Outlines of Pyrrhonism then we would be left with almost all of Sextus' work but virtually all of it composed of arguments -- and strategies for argument -- which are dialectical in nature.
This said, there are two sets of considerations which can help us judge whether Carneades is a mere dialectician or committed (in some qualified way) to skepticism. One is the available textual evidence. Here the two most important sources are Sextus and Cicero (Numenius' account of in Eusebius is very general and unreliably hostile). There can be no doubt that Sextus straightforwardly interprets Carneades as a sceptic. This means that the dialectical intepretation must hang on Cicero who is particularly important, for he uses Clitomachus' work, and this is as close to Carneades as it is possible to get.
The most important evidence in favour of the dialectical interpretation is found at Academica 2.139, where Cicero says that Clitomachus used to declare that he had never been able to understand what Carneades did accept. This passage is, however, invariably quoted and cited without any discussion of the fact that it is embedded in a discussion of the good, in which Carneades is said to have defended Calliphon's view that pleasure is the good with such zeal "that he was thought actually to accept it (although Clitomachus used to declare that he had never been able to understand what Carneades did accept)" (see Striker, 55; Hankinson, 94; Inwood & Gerson, 165; Long & Sedley, Vol 1, 455). Understood within this context, one need not understand this as the claim that Carneades was a dialectician. Clearly Clitomachus rejects a pure dialectical interpretation, for the latter would require that he report that Carneades accepted no views, not that it was unclear which ones he accepted. Still more importantly, Cicero's claim is most plausibly interpreted as the claim that Clitomachus was unsure of the views that Carneades held with respect to the nature of the good . If I say "I'm inclined to the kind of behaviourism Wittgenstein sometimes defends (though I am unsure what view he himself endorses)..." then this need not (indeed, should not) be taken as the view that I am unsure of Wittgenstein's views with regard to everything. Something similar can be said in the case of Cicero.
Alternatively, one might defend the dialectical interpretation of Carneades on philosophical grounds. At first glance it is attractive because it appears to save Carneades from the standard complaint against skepticism: the charge of inconsistency. The problem is that it appears to do so at the cost of leaving him with a peculiarly negative philosophy which does not provide any basis for action (indeed, is inconsistent with it insofar as it allows no assent). It is hard to see this as a compelling philosophy that would satisfy someone of the stature of Carneades, especially when he lived at a time when philosophies were integrally involved with the question how one should live one's life. It is in keeping with this that ancient commentators do seem concerned to note that Carneades is in some sense committed to common attitudes and beliefs (see Lactantius, Div. Ins. 5.14.5 and Cicero, On Divination, 2.148).
Finally, one might argue that Carneades can avoid the charge of inconsistency without having to become a dialectician, so long as he emphasizes (as he appears to) the qualified and subjective nature of the assent that he endorses. The latter means that Carneadean assent does not mean assent to claims about what is (objectively) true and is compatible with a rejection of the latter. If this is right, then Carneades does not adopt the kind of skepticism that Philo and Metrodorus are said to ascribe to him at Academica 2.78 -- i.e. a skepticism which holds that the wise man can perceive nothing (as true) but may accept an opinion (on what is true) nonetheless. We should surely follow Cicero in this regard, who goes on to say that he prefers to the view of Clitomachus, who holds that Carnedes "did not so much accept this view as advance it in argument" (it is indeed true that this shows Carneades at work as a dialectician, but it is not true -- as Hankinson, 94 assumes -- that it amounts to the claim that this is his only mode of argument).
The question whether Carneades' move to qualified, subjectively defined, beliefs can provide him with a consistent skepticism is, of course, open to debate. As the kinds of issues this implies are tied up with fundamental questions about the viability of skepticism, they are discussed in the final section of this article.
Aenesidemus' books on Pyrrhonism do not survive, but they are usefully summarized by Photius. In them we already find the systematization of the sceptical perspective which characterizes later Pyrrhonism. It includes the establishment of standard argumentative strategies, the collection of an enormous array of arguments, puzzles and conundrums borrowed from the whole of Greek philosophy, and the sorting of standard arguments (or "modes" or "tropes") in sets designed to force epoche on all matters. On the basis of this arsenal of arguments and his own ingenuity, the later Pyrrhonean is well equipped to construct antitheses and oppose any and every claim that he encounters. Sextus explains the Pyrrhonean strategy with a medical metaphor, proposing the sceptics' arguments as a means for "curing" the rashness of the dogmatists. In explaining why there are times when the sceptic's collection of arguments includes those which are weak, for example, he says that the sceptic uses arguments of different strengths "just as doctors have remedies of different strengths for bodily ailments and for those suffering excessively employs the strong ones and for those suffering mildly the mild ones" (PH 3.280, Inwood & Gerson).
The theoretical development of ancient skepticism evident in later Pyrrhonism is particularly clear in the different sets of modes it offers as a route to epoche. They are usefully collected in Sextus' Outlines of Pyrrhonism. The ten modes which he attributes "to the older sceptics" (PH 1.35-63) invoke opposition by contrasting:
(1) The opposing perceptions and views of the world which characterize different species. "[I]n respect of touch," for example, "how could one maintain that creatures covered with shells, with flesh with prickles, with feathers, with scales are all similarly affected?" and "sweet oil seems very agreeable to men, but intolerable to beetles and bees; and olive oil is beneficial to men, but when poured on wasps and bees it destroys them; and sea water is a disagreeable and poisonous drink for men, but fish drink and enjoy it." (50, 55, Bury)(2) The opposing perceptions and views of the world which characterize different individuals. "[T]he greatest demonstration of the great and boundless difference among the intellects of men is," for example, "the disagreement among the utterances of the dogmatists [the non-sceptical philosophers], especially that concerning what it is fitting to choose and to avoid." (85, Inwood & Gerson)
(3) The opposing perceptions and views of the world which characterize different sense organs. "Pictures seem to the sense of sight to have concavities and convexities," for example, "but not to the touch," and "Let us imagine someone wh from birth has ...lacked hearing and sight. He will start out believing in the existence of nothing visible or audible, but only of the three kinds of quality he can register. It is therefore a possibility that we too, having only our five senses, only register from the qualities belonging to the apple those which we are capable of registering. But it may be that there obvectively exist other qualities." (92, 96, Long & Sedley).
(4) The opposing perceptions and views of the world which characterize different circumstances. Thus "things strike us differently depending on whether we are in a natural or unnatural state, since madmen and those possessed by the gods seem to hear the voices of daimons, but we do ont... And the same water seems to be boiling when poured onto feverish spots, but is [only] lukewarm to us.... And if someone should say that a conjunction of certain humours causes uncongenial presentations to come from the objects to those who are in an unnatural state, then one should say that since even the healthy have a blend of humours, these are able to make the external objects... appear [other than they are] to those who are healthy. For it is a mere whim to give to one set of humours and not to others the power to change external objects." (101-2, Inwood & Gerson)
(5) The oposing perceptions and views of the world that characterize different positions and distances and places. For example, "lamplight appears dim in sunlight but bright in the dark. The same oar appears bent in water but straight when out of it." (119, Annas & Barnes)
(6) The opposing perceptions and views of the world that characterize mixtures. "[W]e deduce that since no object strikes us entirely by itself, but along with something, it may perhaps be possible to say what the mixture compounded out of the external object and the thing perceived with it is like, but we would not be able to say what the external object is like by iself... The same sound appears one way when accompanied by a rarefied atmosphere, another way when accompanied by a dense atmosphere. (124-5, Long & Sedley)
(7) The opposing perceptions and views of the world due to different quantities and structures. "Silver filings," for example, "appear black when they are by themselves, but when united to the whole mass they are sensed as white... And wine strengthens us when drunk in moderation but when too much is taken it paralyses the body... (129-30, Bury)
(8) The opposing views possible because of the relativity of all things. "[S]ince all things are relative, we will suspend judgment about what things exist absolutely and in nature... This has two senses. One is in relation to the judging subject [different subjects perceiving differently]... The other in relation to the conceptions perceived with it, like right in relation to left..." (135-7, Long and Sedley, slightly amended)
(9) The opposing perceptions and views of the world due to constancy or rarity of occurrence. "The sun is," for example, "much more astounding than a comet; but since we see the sun constantly and the comet rarely we are so astounded by the comet that we regard it as a divine sign, but are not at all astounded by the sun. If, however, we imagine the sun as appearing rarely and setting rarely, and illuminating everything all at once and suddenly throwing everything into shadows, then we shall see that there is a great deal of astonishment in the thing... (141, Inwood & Gerson)
(10) The opposing perceptions and views of what is right and wrong which characterize different ways of life, laws, myths and "dogmatic suppositions." "[I]n Persia," for example, "homosexual acts are customary, while in Rome they are forbidden by law; ...among us adultery is forbidden while among the Massagetae it is accepted by custom as indifferent... among us it is forbidden to have sex with your mother, while in Persia it is the custom to favour such marriages; and in Egypt they marry their sisters, which among us is forbidden by law." (152, Annas & Barnes)
Though the ten modes attributed to the earlier ancient sceptics are a rich source of material for sceptical arguments -- and though they play an influential role in the history of skepticism, the later tropes reflect a much deeper appreciation of the epistemological issues which give rise to skepticism. The five modes attributed to Agrippa (discussed extensively by Barnes) illustrate this point (PH 1.164-77). Thus they provide a basis for opposition and suspension of judgment by appealing to:
-- disagreement, for "with regard to the object presented there has arisen both amongst ordinary people and amongst the philosophers an interminable conflict because of which we are unable either to choose a thing or reject it, and so fall back on suspension" (165, Bury);-- regress ad infinitum, for the sceptic can always question the principles and claims made in a proof of a thing, the principles and claims given to show that it constitutes a proof, and so on ad infinitum (as Lewis Carroll does in his famous logical conundrums
-- relativity, for the way that things appear is relative to the subject and his subjective nature, and relative to the concepts used in judging it);
-- hypothesis, for there are times when "the Dogmatists" take as their starting-point something which they do not establish by argument but claim to take for granted, and this can be criticized as arbitrary; and
-- circular reasoning, for there are times when the proof used to establish some issue is implicitly circular, as when sense impressions are used to establish the veracity of the senses.
The standard modes are reduced even further, to a set of two, in the following chapter of the Outlines of Pyrrhonism. This set maintains that everything which is apprehended as true must be seen to be so either through itself or through some other thing. But the first alternative is impossible, for the controversy among philosophers makes it impossible to establish what can be apprehended in itself. And the second alternative is also impossible for if everything is apprehended as true through something else this entails either an irresolvable regress ad infinitum or that there will ultimately be something which can be apprehended as true in virtue of itself. And the latter possibility is undermined by the first mode.
The later Pyrrhonians do not offer these three sets of Pyrrhonian modes (or the set designed to refute causal claims) as the only way to induce a sceptical suspension of judgment. Rather they are offered as useful standard strategies which helpfully sort earlier sceptical arguments. Usually they are backed -- and in Sextus very frequently supplanted -- by innumerable other arguments which can be used to create antithesis and argue for suspension of judgment on any topic. A summary can never fully capture the spirit or the power (or the sometimes bewildering assortment of claims and counter claims) that characterizes the Pyrrhonians unrelenting assault on all opinions. If one wishes to appreciate it, then one needs to pick up a volume of Sextus and read.
As regards sophisms the exposure of which is useful, the dialectician will not have a word to say, but will propound such arguments as these -- "If it is not so that you both have fair horns and have horns, you have horns; but it is not so that you have fair horns and have horns, therefore you have horns." "If a thing moves, it moves either in the spot where it is or where it is not; but it neither moves in the spot where it is (for it is at rest) nor in that where it is not (for how could a thing be active in a spot where it does not so much as exist?)" "Either the existent becomes or the non-existent; now the existent does not become (for it exists); nor yet does the non-existent (for the becoming is passive but the non-existent is not passive); therefore nothing becomes." "Snow is frozen water; but water is black; therefore snow is black."And when he has made a collection of such trash he draws his eyebrows together, and expounds Dialectic and endeavours very solemnly to establish for us by syllogistic proofs that a thing becomes, a thing moves, snow is white, and we do not have horns, although it is probably sufficient to confront the trash with the plain facts, smashing up their positive affirmation with equal contradictory evidence derived from the appearances. (PH 2.241-44, Bury, cf. Timon's attitude reported in D.L. 9.111, 2.107)
A second positive aspect of later Pyrrhonism is the standard Pyrrhonean goal of peace of mind. As Diogenes Laertius puts it, "The sceptics say the goal is suspension of judgement, upon which freedom from anxiety follows like a shadow, as Timon and Aenesidemus and their followers put it." (D.L. 9.107, Inwood & Gerson, cf. PH 1.29). Sextus similarly says that the telos of skepticism is tranquillity of mind (ataraxia) and moderate feeling. For the sceptic set out to determine what is true and false, and thereby tranquillity, but found himself faced with the equal force of opposing points of view (isostheneia), suspended judgment and found that tranquillity of mind resulted (PH 1.26).
Perhaps in reaction to criticism of Pyrrho's severe asceticism (which might be criticized as unrealistic), the later Pyrrhonians are careful to qualify their claims about Pyrrhonian equanimity, clearly stating that it cannot eliminate the trials and tribulations of ordinary life. They therefore claim that their aim is not complete immunity to the trials and tribulations of life, but a more cautious freedom from difficult opinions and "moderate feeling in respect of things unavoidable."
We do not... take Sceptics to be undisturbed in every way -- we say that they are disturbed by things which are forced upon them; for we agree that at times they shiver and are thirsty and have other feelings of this kind. But in these cases ordinary people are afflicted by two sets of circumstances: byt he feelings themselves, and no less by believing that these circumstances are bad by nature. Sceptics, who shed the additional opinon that each of these things is bad in its nature, come off more moderately even in these cases. (PH 1.29-30, Annas & Barnes)
A third aspect of the Pyrrhonians positive philosophy is a response to ancient claims that skepticism makes it impossible to live, because it leaves no room for the beliefs on which our lives depend. Appealing to a precedent set in early Pyrrhonism, later Pyrrhonism answers that it uses appearances as a basis for life, ordinary actions and sceptical assertions. As Diogenes Laertius writes:
Aenesidemus too in the first book of his Pyrrhonian Arguments says that Pyrrho determines nothing dogmatically bcause of the existence of contradictory arguments, but rather follows appearances. He says the same thing in Against Wisdom and On Investigation. And Zeuxis, an associate of Aenesidemus, in On Twofold Arguments and Antiochus of Laodicea and Apellas in his Agrippa posit the phenomena alone. Therefore, according to the sceptics, the appearance is a criterion, as Aenesidemus too says. (D.L. 9.106, Inwood & Gerson)Sextus similarly says that "when we question whether the underlying object is such as it appears, we grant the fact that it appears, and our doubt does not concern the appearance itself but the account given of that appearance -- and that is a different thing from questioning the appearance itself... And even if we do actually argue against the appearances, we do not propound such arguments with the intention of abolishing appearances, but by way of pointing out the rashness of the Dogmatists..." (PH 1.20, Bury)
The later Pyrrhonians acceptance of appearances is consolidated in Sextus' suggestion that the sceptics pair their rejection of a criterion of truth (which would have to denote what is and is not real), with a "standard of action" which still dictates that they "perform some actions and abstain from others." This is the Pyrrhonian "Practical Criterion." A more sophisticated elaboration of the Pyrrhonian acceptance of appearances, it countenance four aspects of the latter.
Adhering, then, to appearances we live in accordance with the normal rules of life, undogmatically... And it would seem that this regulation of life is fourfold, and that one part of it lies in the guidance of Nature (physis), another in the constraint of passions (pathe), another in the tradition of laws and customs (nomoi), another in the instruction of the arts (techne). Nature's guidance is that by which we are naturally capable of sensation and thought; constraint of the passions is that whereby hunger drives us to food and thirst to drink; tradition of customs and laws, that wherby we regard piety in the conduct of life as good, but impiety as evil; instruction of the arts, that whereby we are not inactive in such arts as we adopt. (PH 1.23-4, Bury)As in the case of early Pyrrhonism, there remains the question whether this practical criterion can successfully provide the sceptic with a consistent basis for the beliefs that ordinary life depends on, and whether a more general acceptance of appearance can justify his avowal of the sceptical point of view. In the next section, these questions are considered in the context of broader questions about the significance and relevance of ancient skepticism in the context of modern and contemporary philosophy.
1. How radical is ancient skepticism?
Sextus makes much of the ancient sceptic's open-mindedness, telling us the sceptics have not decided that truth cannot be established. While this admission is an important way to preserve the consistency of skepticism (which must cast doubt on itself as well as other points of view) but the arguments Sextus and other sceptics use make it difficult to see what this amounts to in practice, for they can be used to raise doubts about any position whatsoever. Sextus himself tells us that the sceptic will not assent even if he is faced with a position which he can find no fault with when he says that the sceptics can create opposition by invoking future possibilities. "[A]s, for instance, when someone propounds to us a theory which we are unable to refute, we say to him in reply `Just as, before the birth of the founder of the School to which you belong, the theory it holds was not as yet apparent as a sound theory... so likewise it is possible that the opposite theory to that which you now propound is... not yet apparent to us, so that we ought not as yet yield assent to this theory which at the moment seems to be valid." (PH 1.33-34, Bury) With arguments such as this, the sceptic need not assent to any view, even if he can find nothing to say against it.
The basic problems that motivate skepticism are also universally applicable. The problem of the criterion arises because there seems no way to settle the disputes about the criterion of truth. "In order to decide the dispute... we must possess an accepted criterion by which we shall be able to judge the dispute; and in order to possess an accepted criterion, the dispute about the criterion must first be decided. And when the argument thus reduces itself to a form of circular reasoning the discovery of the criterion become impracticable, since we do not allow them to adopt a criterion by assumption, while if they offer to judge the criterion by a criterion we force them to a regress ad infinitum." (PH 2.20) Because this argument is obviously applicable to any criterion of truth it appears able to undermine any claim to truth (for it will assume a criterion of truth which can be questioned).
The radical nature of the ancient sceptic's doubts can be seen from (among many other things) their use of other ancient philosophies. Here the important point is that the radical nature of ancient philosophical views allows the sceptics to use these views to -- from an ancient point of view -- plausibly question any claim. A notable example is Gorgias, who propounded famous ancient arguments for the conclusions that (i) nothing exists, (ii) if anything did exist we could not know so, and (iii) if we did know we could not communicate this existence. Sextus takes a special interest in these arguments (and preserves our most important fragment of them) precisely because can be used to call any claim into question -- for if nothing exists, then all beliefs are false. For similar reasons, we find him invoking the opinions of obscure thinkers like Xeniades of Corinth -- who, he says, maintained that every impression and opinion is false (AM 7.53, cf. 48: a disconcerting view but on consideration no more disconcerting than the Protagorean view that every opinion is true, and contradiction is impossible).
The answer to our first question is thus relatively straightforward. Ancient sceptical doubt is radical -- as radical as is possible, for it is founded on arguments which can be used to oppose any position whatsoever.
2. How relevant is ancient skepticism?
The mere fact that ancient skepticism encompasses a radical doubting of all opinions and beliefs does not, however, demonstrate that it is relevant to modern and contemporary philosophy. While a serious willingness to countenance Gorgias' arguments for non-being can be used to cast doubt on everything, such doubts are not significant, for Gorgias' arguments are not (rightly or wrongly) taken seriously today. A positive answer to the question whether the sceptics' doubts remain relevant must instead be founded on a recognition that they raise doubts that remain of significance today.
It can in this regard be said that arguments which remain relevant to our philosophical concerns are abundant in ancient skepticism, even though there seem cases in which the sceptics do not develop their doubts to the extent that now seems possible (in the realm of politics, for example), and even though the sceptics most interesting arguments are frequently obscured by other arguments (and by terminology and ways of talking) which are to us strange and unfamiliar or simply weak and insignificant. It is in this regard notable that the ancient sceptics' repetoire encompasses analogues of Humes' critique of cause (see Groarke & Solomon), Descartes' `hyperbolical' doubts in his first meditation (see Groarke), the problem of induction, skepticism about sense impressions, Zeno's paradoxes, and the questions raised by contemporary discussions of realism and foundationalism. At the heart of ancient skepticism one finds a very clear understanding of the basic epistemological issues raised by any attempt to build a rational basis for belief. The problem of the criterion and the later modes in particular ask the pointed question how we can establish a basis for belief given that the attempt to ground it seems to inevitably require that we take refuge in assumptions that can be questioned (assumptions like the law of non-contradiction, a belief in the external world, etc.), or construct arguments which appear to be necessarily circular.
It is perhaps notable that contemporary epistemology does depart from ancient sceptical concerns when it embraces the kind of linguistic answer to skepticism which is so notable in Wittgenstein and those who he has influenced (e.g., Putnam). Certainly there is no evidence of an extended ancient discussion of the suggestion that questions about the foundations of belief are in some sense mistaken because their meaning is determined in ways that make sceptical hypotheses inherently contradictory or nonsensical. At best it might be said that Aristocles does suggest that skepticism is inconsistent with the assumption that the sceptic understands language (Eusebius, 14.18) and, perhaps, that Timon's claim that the sceptic accepts appearances and, thereby, what is customary might be interpreted as containing a glimmer of the Wittgensteinian position (for it suggests that philosophical concerns about skepticism somehow take us beyond what is ordinary and appropriate). But these similarities should not be exaggerated.
Is ancient skepticism consistent?
The last question which needs to be asked about ancient skepticism is one that originates in ancient times and becomes a mainstay of the sceptical/anti-sceptical debate. It is the question whether ancient skepticism is untenable because it is inconsistent. In the context of ancient skepticism, we might put this question as the question why the sceptics' suspension of judgment doesn't mean that they suspend judgment on the truth of skepticism. The sceptics answer that they do, but that they accept it in some "undogmatic" way which does not contradict their skepticism (Frede is, in particular, notable for his defense of this point of view). We might put our question as the question whether we can defend the ancient sceptics' claims that skepticism leaves room for some kind of qualified belief (by endorsing appearances, the eulogon, etc.) which permits both skepticism and the beliefs that life depends upon (by endorsing appearances, the eulogon, etc.). We may usefully add the question whether such attempts are significant in the context of contemporary epistemology.
This is not the place for a detailed discussion of this issue, but one fundamental point merits comment. We might summarize skepticism by saying that the ancient sceptics suspend judgment on the truth of any claim. But it must be remembered that in doing so they assume a particular conception of truth. As Burnyeat points out, this ancient conception of truth tends is a realist one -- it holds that a claim is true if it corresponds to a real objective world that is not subjective, but exists, as we might put it, "a god's eye point of view." As Burnyeat puts it:
In the controversy between the sceptic and the dogmatists over whether any truth exists at all, the issue is whether any proposition of a class of propositions can be accepted as true of a real objective world as distinct from mere appearance. For "true" in these discussions means "true of a real objective world"; the true, if there is such a thing is what confroms with the real, an association traditional to the word alethes since the earliest period of Greek philosophy (cf. M XI 221).This is a crucial point for it makes ancient skepticism an attack on a realist conception of truth which has some affinities to modern and contemporary anti-realism. In the present context, the important point is that Burnyeat appears to draw the wrong conclusions from his own insight, for he concludes that "if epoche is suspending belief about real existence as contrasted with appearance, that will amount to suspending all belief, since belief is accepting something as true" (my emphasis). This simply does not follow, for the recognition that the ancient sceptics (and non-sceptics) are concerned with realist truth entails the conclusion that their suspension of judgment is a rejection of any claim to realist truth -- i.e. a suspension of judgment on the question whether a particular view or outlook is true in this sense. Rather than eschew all belief, the sceptic thus rejects a particular kind of belief which modern and contemporary philosophy show to be only one of a variety of alternatives. Unlike contemporary anti-realists, the sceptics do not propose an alternative conception of truth, but their attempt to propose a less `dogmatic' conception of belief performs a similar function in ancient epistemology.Now clearly, if truth is restricted to matters pertaining to real existence, as contrasted with appearance, the same will apply [to related sceptical conceptions]... The notions involved, consistency and conflict, undecidability, isostheneia, epoche, ataraxia, since they are defined in terms of truth, will all relate, via truth to real existence rather than appearance. (Burnyeat, "Can the Sceptic Live His Scepticism," p. 121)
The extent to which the analogy between ancient skepticism and contemporary anti-realism can be carried is open to debate, but it is an important compariston, for it suggests both that skepticism is not fatally inconsistent (for it rejects realist truth and endorses an anti-realist conception of belief) and that the positive account of belief that it proposes is, like many of its arguments against claims to truth, significantly relevant to modern and contemporary concerns.
First published: November 4, 1997 Content last modified: November 4, 1997