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[1] Ortcutt believes that someone is a spy.This could mean just that
[2] Ortcutt believes that there are spiesor that Ortcutt has more interesting information:
[3] Someone is an x such that Ortcutt believes that x is a spy.The distinction here can be seen as a distinction of scope for the existential quantifier. In [2], the existential quantifier is interpreted as having small scope, within the propositional clause of the belief attribution.
[2*] Ortcutt believes: x, x is a spy.In [3], however, the existential quantifier has large scope, selecting an individual and then ascribing a belief that relates Ortcutt to that particular individual.
[3*] x, Ortcutt believes that x is a spy.The ambiguity in [1] and the simple way of distinguishing the two interpretations in [2*] and [3*] suggest that we are on to something. Russell's theory of definite descriptions employs just such a distinction in answering Frege's puzzles about belief. (See Definite descriptions.)
We just identified the distinction between [2*] and [3*] as a distinction in the scope of the quantifier. But [3*] also introduces something that needs a further account. On the standard semantics for quantification, the interpretation of [3*] requires that we be able to say when an individual x satisfies the open sentence ` Ortcutt believes that x is a spy'. Looked at another way, we no longer have a complete statement of a proposition in the propositional clause position in the sentence, since `that x is a spy' does not express a proposition with a definite truth-value. Considerations like these have motivated the identification of a distinction between de dicto belief attributions like [2] and [2*] and de re belief attributions like [3] and [3*]. The purely de dicto attribution relates Ortcutt to a dictum, a complete propositional content. The de re attribution relates him to a res, an individual that his belief is about. To say that an individual satisfies `Ortcutt believes that x is a spy' is to say that Ortcutt has a de re belief about that individual. (For more on de re belief, see Quine 1956, Burge 1977.)
Although it may be tempting to think of these as an ambiguity in the verb `believe', the section Ambiguity theories explains why this is not possible.
First published: February 16, 2000
Content last modified: February 16, 2000