• Entry Content
• Writing Your Entry in HTML
• Entry Format
• Entry Revision
• The Use of Footnotes
• The Use of Special Symbols

Entry Content

The length of entries will typically be the equivalent of 2,000 to 6,000 words, depending on the requirements of the topic. However, authors may write somewhat longer entries if they organize the material in tree (nested), rather than in linear, format. By this we mean that the main HTML page of the entry should be readable in a sitting of about an hour or two maximum. If the author wishes to include more detailed material, this material can be put into a separate HTML page and linked into an appropriate (and well sign-posted) place of the main HTML page. The reader can follow these links if they are interested in the more technical or scholarly details. In this way, the document can be structured as a tree and can therefore be of interest to a wide audience. However, authors should create such nestings only if it seems unlikely that a separate entry in the Encyclopedia will be created to discuss this material. We will offer further guidelines on how to "nest" your documents below.

Finally, note that you can examine the sourcefile of existing entries in the Encyclopedia for style, content, and length.

Writing Your Entry in HTML

To begin writing an entry, authors should follow the instructions sent to them for downloading the sourcefile of the "Entry Template". They can simply "Open" that file using an HTML Editor. This Entry Template will ensure that there is a uniform entry style, which is described below, in the section on "Entry Format".

For those authors who prefer to create an HTML sourcefile directly, without the assistance of an HTML editor, we've indicated, in our instructions, how to obtain the "Annotated Sourcefile". After downloading the sourcefile, authors can replace the sample text in this file with their own content. This will minimize the number of HTML commands authors will need to learn.

Note that it is easy to link your main entry to supplementary material that would interfere with the presentation if included in the main document. To create a nesting from the main document to a supplementary document, suppose that the main document is entitled "index.html" and the supplementary document is entitled "supplement.html". Now suppose that at the end of a paragraph, you wish place a labeled link to the supplementary document. Here is what the link might be displayed as:

... . We discuss this last point in further detail in the following supplementary document:

Supplement on [Title of Supplement]

...in the following supplementary document.
<BLOCKQUOTE>
<A HREF="supplement.html">Supplement on [Title of Supplement]</A>
</BLOCKQUOTE>

Entry Format

• Introduction (Definition)
• Internal Links
• Main Sections of the Entry
• Bibliography
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

Introduction. The Introduction should contain a brief definition of the subject. This may take one or two paragraphs, and if possible, these paragraphs should contain some statement of the subject's interest and significance. The main topics to be covered in the body of the entry may be mentioned here, so that the reader will get some idea of what is to follow.

Internal Links. The internal links should be a list of the main sections of the entry, and each item in the list should be a link to that section. The HTML commands needed to do this are included in the template and in the annotated sourcefile.

Main Sections. The sectioning of the entry is at the discretion of the author. However, we encourage authors to include a Chronology or "Life" section in Biographical entries. Moreover, a "History" section is called for in the discussion of many topics.

Bibliography. Please use a standard bibliographic format, beginning with author's last names, and at least the initials of their first names. The format "City:Publisher, Date" is preferred to the "Publisher, Date" format.

Other Internet Resources. To complete this section, authors are encouraged to conduct an on-line search of the Web for websites with high-academic-quality content on the topic in question. These should be sites that would be of interest to readers whose goal is to think more clearly about the subject. Your first search should be conducted on the Limited Area Search Engines for philosophy known as Hippias and Noesis. They can be found at the URLs:

http://hippias.evansville.edu/
http://noesis.evansville.edu

http://altavista.digital.com/

Related Entries. Please list the names of the most important concepts and philosophers that occur in your entry. You may list keywords that do not appear as topics in our Table of Contents if you feel that they are important. We have a program which will notice the discrepancy and alert the Editor. A decision will be made whether or not to include a new entry on that topic. If we decide that the topic is too specialized or otherwise inappropriate for the Encyclopedia, we will eliminate this keyword from your list in the Related Entries section.

Entry Revision

Authors can revise in one of two ways. If the changes are minor (e.g., you wish to add an item to the Bibliography, or you wish to modify the wording in a paragraph, or fix a typo, etc.), then you can log in to our Author Area: http://plato.stanford.edu/cgi-bin/encyclopedia/authors.cgi and initiate the action Make Minor Changes to Server File. This will allow you to directly edit a copy of your entry on our machine (from whichever browser you are using). If you decide to make major changes to your entry (e.g., revise a section completely, add a new section, etc.), then you should begin the process of revision by: (1) notifying the Editor that you plan to make major changes, and (2) log on to our Author Area and initiate the action of Download Existing Entry. (You can also download your entry by using your browser to examine and download the file.) After after editing this file, it should then be uploaded back to the Encyclopedia using our Author Area and the Upload Single File action. It is prudent to send the Editor a brief note ahead of time, indicating that you plan to transfer a new version of your entry because the Editor can warn you whether any editorial changes being made to the Encyclopedia make it an inopportune time to upload updates to entries.

We ask you to begin major revisions by downloading your entry from the Encyclopedia because your copy of the HTML sourcefile that you originally sent us is most probably out of date! When we receive your entry for the first time, we almost always have to make some changes to your HTML sourcefile. We must have a sourcefile that will look just like the other entries, so that our automated procedures and programs can operate on a well-defined structure. Here is an example of one reason why we modify the entries we receive: some text- and HTML-editors put entire paragraphs on a single line. This is incompatible with good search engines. Such search engines return a whole line as "context" whenever it finds a match for the keyword used in the search. So if there are no linebreaks in your paragraphs, the search engine will return the entire paragraph! But there are several other ways in which we sometimes have to modify the sourcefile you send us.

So, if you do not follow the "major revision" procedure by first downloading your entry from the Encyclopedia and you work on an out of date version of your file, we would then have to ask you to make the modifications again to an editorially correct file. So, to avoid this nuisance, please remember to notify us of your intentions to make major changes to the Encyclopedia's version of your file on the day you start your modifications.

One Further Special Request: Some text- and HTML-editors are not friendly to HTML sourcefiles when you load those files into the editor. Some add special control characters to the file; others make changes to the HTML, following their own conception of how HTML should be written. So please make future modifications to your entry by using a simple text editor and saving the file as ASCII/plain text (HTML is written in ASCII/plain text). Though a simple text editor will show you all the HTML formatting code, it should be easy to find your way around the file and edit the portions you are interested in. By using a simple text editor, you save us the trouble of having to reedit the HTML produced by these unfriendly HTML editors.

The Use of Footnotes

...some text.^[x]

To produce this, use the following HTML code at the point in the text where the footnote should occur:

...some text.^{[<A HREF="notes.html#x" NAME="return-x">x</A>]}

This will place "[x]" as a superscript in the text, with "x" a link to the place in the notes.html file where the NAME="x" occurs (see below). The NAME="return-x" marks the spot in the current file to which a "Return" link in the notes.html file will return (again, see below). Then, create another HTML file named "notes.html" and begin footnote x with the following HTML code:

<P>
[<A HREF="index.html#return-x" NAME="x">x.</A>] Begin the body of the footnote.

This will start a new paragraph, start the footnote with the symbols "[x.]" (with "x." both a link back to NAME="return-x" in the main text and NAME="x" the name of the place in the current file into which the footnote in the main text will be linked). Note: Users of the Encyclopedia can always use the "Back" or "Return" button on their browsers to get back to the text.

The Use of Special Symbols

In the meantime, if the special symbol you need is not on this list of special HTML characters which is widely supported, we have created a wide variety of small graphics of the Greek, logic, and math symbols that logicians and others typically use. These symbols are located at the URL:

Table of Symbols

To produce the formatted line:

x y

<I>x</I> <IMG SRC="element.gif"> <I>y</I>

You may use any graphic found in our symbols directory in this way. If you need a symbol not found in that directory, write to the editor---they are easily constructed.