Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
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Snark
Snarks are a species of bandersnatch. They are thought to have evolved
from the slithy toves along with the other bandersnatches. Snarks were
common in New England forests until the late 19th century, when it was
thought that they were hunted to extinction. Recent ethological
expeditions, however, have uncovered evidence that there may be a few
extant individuals. Snarks are favorites with animal lovers everywhere
because in the spring, they gyre and gimble on small ponds in a
brilliant mating display. In reference works on bandersnatches, snarks
are referred to as a group by the Latin name Snarkidae.
Snarks are a species of bandersnatch and are thought to have evolved
from the slithy toves along with the other bandersnatches. Snarks
evolved in the Devonian period and successfully adapted themselves in
several ecological niches until the late 19th century. The fact that
they have a dorsal sigmoid bone establishes their descent from the
slithy toves.
Snarks bear young just at the point in early summer when their food
source is most abundant. Their biological clocks are very well tuned
and biologists study them as the principal model of such clocks in the
animal kingdom.
There is nothing like the wonder and pageantry of snarks in mating
season, as they gyre and gimble on the ponds of New England forests.
- Doe, J., "The Ecological Range of the Snark," Ecology
Today 3/1 (January 1992): 15-30
- Dodgson, C., "The Origins of Bandersnatches," Annals of the
Society for the Investigation of the Descendants of the Slithy
Toves XL (1993): 1-20
bandersnatch |
gyration |
toves
Copyright © 1997, 2001
by
Charles Dodgson
dodgson@alice.uwonderland.edu
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Table of Contents
First published: September 14, 1995
Content last modified: January 9, 2001