Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Spring 2001 Edition
Entry Content: Guidelines and Policies
In this document, we develop guidelines and policies concerning the
content of entries written for the Stanford Encyclopedia of
Philosophy.
The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy is intended to serve
as an authoritative reference work suitable for use by professionals
and students in the field of philosophy, as well as by all others
interested in authoritative discussions on philosophical topics.
Entries should therefore be written with the highest of professional
standards, and be of interest to as wide an audience as
possible. Entries should focus on the philosophical issues and
arguments rather than on sociology and individuals, particularly in
discussions of topics in contemporary philosophy. In other words,
entries should be "idea-driven" and not "people-driven".
Bibliographic entries should be critical and not hagiographical.
All entries should provide objective, neutral analyses or
surveys of particular topics, rather than promoting idiosyncratic or
controversial points of view. Authors should see their task as one
of offering a broad or insightful perspective which introduces both
the topic and the literature and which puts the reader into position
to read the primary and secondary sources cited in the entry. (To
this end, the sources of all quotations should be clearly
identified.) Clarity of substance and style should also be one of
the most important goals.
Encyclopedia entries should therefore not be polemical.
Controversial claims should be identified as such. Authors should
not use the first person pronoun "I", and should avoid such
constructions as "as I have argued elsewhere/previously...". In
addition, authors should not cite or refer to unpublished or
inaccessible materials, and in particular, to unpublished
dissertations or talks. Authors should also be circumspect in the
number of references to their own work, though obviously, since they
are experts on the topic and typically will have written widely on
it, occasional references will be in order and appropriate. The
editors of the Encyclopedia will ensure that entries do not
overstep the bounds of propriety in this regard.
The length of entries should depend on the topic. Entries will
typically range from 6,000-7,000 words, but may be anywhere from half
this long to twice this long depending on the how broadly the topic
is focused and how much literature there is to introduce and explain.
We encourage authors to organize longer entries by writing a set of
nested, cross-linked documents rather than by writing a single,
linear document. By this we mean that overly detailed, highly
technical, or highly scholarly material should be put into separate
HTML ("supplementary") documents and linked into the main entry.
(See below.) This way, the main entry should become readable by an
intelligent undergraduate in a sitting of about an hour or two. More
advanced readers can follow the links to the highly technical,
detailed or scholarly material. Such a cross-linked set of documents
will therefore be accessible to a wide audience. However, authors
should create such "nested" entries only if it seems unlikely that a
separate entry in the Encyclopedia will be created to
discuss the supplementary material.
Because the Encyclopedia is being served over the World
Wide Web, all entries must be written in HTML (HyperText Markup
Language). This is the formatting language that controls the way
text, graphics, and links are displayed in Web browsers. There are
now available numerous software programs known as "HTML-editors" or
"web authoring tools" and these allow the authors to format text and
graphics in HTML easily, without learning any arcane commands.
These programs are now as easy to use as Microsoft Word.
To begin writing an entry, authors should follow our instructions
for downloading the sourcefile of the "Entry Template". Once the
template is downloaded, the author may simply "Open" that file using
an HTML-editor. This Entry Template will ensure that there is a
uniform entry style, which is described below, in the section on
"Entry Format".
For those authors who prefer to create an HTML sourcefile directly,
without the assistance of an HTML-editor, we've indicated, in our
instructions, how to obtain the "Annotated Sourcefile". After
downloading the sourcefile, authors can replace the sample text in
this file with their own content. This will minimize the number of
HTML commands authors will need to learn.
Note that it is easy to create a link from your main entry to
supplementary documents containing overly technical or scholarly
material that would interfere with the presentation of the main
ideas. To create a link from the main document to a supplementary
document, suppose that the main document is entitled "index.html" and
the supplementary document is entitled "supplement.html". Now
suppose that at the end of a paragraph, you wish place a labeled link
to the supplementary document. Here is what the link might be
displayed as:
... . We discuss this last point in further detail in the following
supplementary document:
Supplement on [Title of Supplement]
Authors using an HTML-editor (such as Netscape Composer,
Adobe Page Mill, Front Page Express, etc.) will have to use
the functions provided by their software to create such
a link. However, authors who can edit their HTML sourcefiles
directly would insert the following HTML code in order
to produce this link to the supplementary document:
...in the following supplementary document.
<blockquote>
<a href="supplement.html" name="return-1">Supplement on [Title of Supplement]</a>
</blockquote>
Note that this can be done in other places in your main document, if
you have more than one supplementary document. (You will have to
name your supplements as "supplement1.html", "supplement2.html", etc.)
You can find the sourcefile for the supplement template
here (use the View Source
function of your browser after following this link).
The Entry Template and Annotated Sourcefile are formatted in HTML so
that the following divisions are preserved in every entry:
- Introduction (Definition)
- Internal Links
- Main Sections of the Entry
- Bibliography
- Other Internet Resources
- Related Entries
These are discussed in turn.
Introduction. The Introduction should contain a brief
definition of the subject. This may take one or two paragraphs, and
if possible, these paragraphs should contain some statement of the
subject's interest and significance. The main topics to be covered in
the body of the entry may be mentioned here, so that the reader will
get some idea of what is to follow.
Internal Links. The internal links should be a list of the
main sections of the entry, and each item in the list should be a link
to that section. The HTML commands needed to do this are included in
the template and in the annotated sourcefile.
Main Sections. The sectioning of the entry is at the discretion
of the author. However, we encourage authors to include a Chronology
or "Life" section in Biographical entries. Moreover, a "History"
section is called for in the discussion of many topics.
Bibliography. Please use a standard bibliographic format,
beginning with author's last names, and at least the initials of
their first names. The format "City:Publisher, Date" is preferred to
the "Publisher, Date" format. This section is reserved primarily for
refereed material, whether print-based or on the web.
Books, journal articles, e-journal articles, etc., which have
undergone the normal referee process of legitimate presses should be
included. Whenever a cited article or book is available online,
a link may be included to the URL.
Other Internet Resources. The author should cite material on
the web that is of excellent value but which may not have undergone a
referee process. The author serves as referee for these materials
(and our subject editors will referee these choices). To complete
this section, authors are encouraged to conduct an on-line search of
the Web for websites with high-quality, academic content on
the topic in question. Such websites should be written and
maintained by qualified individuals having a clear expertise on the
topic. The task of finding such external websites is made
considerably simpler by using the Limited Area Search Engines for
philosophy, such as Hippias and Noesis. They can be found at the
URLs:
http://hippias.evansville.edu/
http://noesis.evansville.edu
If this doesn't yield any results, you should try one of the wider
area search engines, such as Google or Alta Vista, which can be found
at:
http://www.google.com/
http://www.altavista.com/
Other search engines include www.lycos.com and www.yahoo.com.
Please do not create links to websites that are not maintained by
qualified individuals.
Related Entries. Please list the names of the most
important concepts and philosophers that occur in your entry. You
may list keywords that do not appear as topics in our Table of
Contents if you feel that they are important. We are running
software which will notice the discrepancy and alert the Editor. A
decision will be made whether or not to include a new entry on that
topic. If we decide that the topic is too specialized or otherwise
inappropriate for the Encyclopedia, we will eliminate this keyword
from your list in the Related Entries section.
Because the Encyclopedia is designed to be a dynamic
reference work, authors are responsible for maintaining and
periodically updating their entries. Specifically, authors are
expected: (1) to update their entries regularly, especially in
response to important new research on the topic of the entry, and (2)
to revise their entries in a timely way in light of any
valid criticism they receive, whether it comes from the subject
editors on our Editorial Board, other members of the profession, or
interested readers. In connection with (1), authors should update
the Bibliography and the Other Internet Resources sections of their
entries regularly, to keep pace with significant new publications,
both in print and on the web. In connection with (2), the validity
of criticism shall be determined by the Editor, typically in
consultation with the relevant members of the Editorial Board. The
length of time required for a "timely" revision will be negotiable
and will both respect the author's current commitments and reflect
the seriousness of the criticism. However, entries which require
revision but which are not revised within the negotiated timetable
may be retired from the active portion of the Encyclopedia
and left in the Encyclopedia Archives until such time as the
entry is revised so as to engage the valid criticisms in question.
Making Minor Modifications:
If the changes you would like to make are minor (e.g., you wish to
add an item to the Bibliography, or you wish to modify the wording in
a paragraph, or fix a typo, etc.), then you can log in to our Author
Area:
http://plato.stanford.edu/cgi-bin/encyclopedia/authors.cgi
and initiate the action "Make Minor Changes to Server File". This will
allow you to directly edit a copy of your entry on our machine (from
whichever browser you are using).
Making Major Modifications:
If you decide to make major changes to your entry (e.g., revise a
section completely, add a new section, etc.), then you should begin
the process of revision by downloading your entry from the
Encyclopedia (either by logging on to our Author Area and
initiating the action "Download Existing Entry", or by using your
browser to examine and download the file). After after editing this
file, it should then be uploaded back to the Encyclopedia by
using our Author Area and the "Upload Single File" action.
We ask you to begin major revisions by downloading your entry from
the Encyclopedia because your copy of the HTML sourcefile that you
originally sent us will be out of date! When we receive your entry
for the first time, the sourcefile is processed both automatically and
by hand to rectify the HTML and make the style consistent with our
other entries. So please do not edit/revise the out-of-date copy
on your computer
Finally, please remember that many HTML-editors do not follow
international standards for producing correct HTML. Some add special
control characters to the file; others make changes to the HTML,
following their own conception of how HTML should be written. So
please make major modifications to your entry by using a simple
text editor and by saving the file as ASCII/plain text (HTML is
an ASCII/plain text markup language). Though a simple text editor
will show you all the HTML markup tags, it should be easy to find
your way around the file and edit the portions you are interested in.
By using a simple text editor, you save us the trouble of having to
reprocess (sometimes by hand) the HTML produced by these unfriendly
HTML-editors.
Footnotes may be included. Then can often help to shorten the main
page of the entry, to make it more readable. The footnotes themselves
should be put into a separate html file called "notes.html" and these
should be placed into the same directory on plato.stanford.edu as the
entry. If you are using an HTML-editor to create your entry,
then you will need to use the functions provided by your software
in order to create foonotes as links to a footnote file.
However, for those authors who wish to edit their HTML sourcefile
directly in order to create links from the text to the footnotes,
here are some guidelines to follow. Suppose you want to add footnote
number x at a point in the text:
...some text.[x]
To produce this in your HTML sourcefile, use the following HTML
code at the point in the text where the footnote should occur:
...some text.<sup>[<a href="notes.html#x" name="note-x">x</a>]</sup>
This will place "[x]" as a superscript in the text, with "x" a link
to the place in the notes.html file identified as name="x" (see
below). The name="note-x" marks the spot in the current file to
which a "Return" link from the notes.html file will return (again, see
below). Then, create another HTML file named "notes.html" and
in that file you will try to produce something that looks like this:
x. Begin the body of the
footnote here.
To produce this line in the notes.html file, you would add the
following HTML code:
<p>
<a href="index.html#note-x" name="x">x.</a> Begin
the body of the footnote.
This will start a new paragraph, start the footnote with the symbols
"x." ("x." will be a link back to name="note-x" in the main
index.html file; the name="x" identifies the place in the notes.html
file to which the footnote in the main text will be linked). Note:
Users of the Encyclopedia can always use the "Back" or "Return"
button on their browsers to get back to the text.
Although the
specifications
for the HTML4.0 language does include support for a variety of
special symbols,
including Greek, logic and math symbols, there is little support for
arranging these symbols on the page in the variety of ways needed by
mathematicians and logicians. A new standard for typesetting
mathematical and logical formulas is developing, namely, MathML. See
W3C Math: MathML puts Math on the
Web.
However, it will be sometime before web browsers are reprogrammed to
meet this standard. So, for now, we would ask you not to employ the
MathML standard or the symbols that are supported in HTML4.0.
In the meantime, if the special symbol you need is not on this
list of special HTML characters
which is widely supported, we have created a wide variety of small
graphics of the Greek, logic, and math symbols that logicians and
others typically use. These symbols are located at the URL:
Table of Symbols
For example, we have produced the following
graphic of the symbol for the "set membership" relation:
This symbol can be found at the URL displayed above and you can
download it onto your machine from there. Follow the link to
"element.gif" in the table for Math symbols. You can then save that
graphic onto the drive of your local computer.
If you are using an HTML-editor to create your entry, then you
simply use your software's "add image" ("add graphic") function
to place this graphic in your entry. However, those authors
who are editing their HTML sourcefiles directly should use the
following guidelines. To produce the formatted line:
x y
place the file "element.gif" into the directory containing your
HTML entry and use the following HTML code in your entry:
<em>x</em> <img src="element.gif"> <em>y</em>
Be sure to transfer the graphic to the same directory on plato when you
transfer your entry to us.
You may use any graphic found in our symbols directory in this way.
If you need a symbol not found in that directory, write to the
editor---they are easily constructed.