...Zalta.
The authors would like to thank David Barker-Plummer, Mark Greaves, Andrew Irvine, Emma Pease, Susanne Riehemann, and Nathan Tawil for critical suggestions which often led to improvements in the Encyclopedia's design. We would also like to thank the anonymous referees at the journal Computing and the Humanities for their suggestions on how to improve the paper.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
...succession.
For example, Louis Moréri tried this solution with his Grand Dictionnaire Historique of 1674, as did Arnold Brockhaus, in his Konversations-Lexikon, 1796-1811.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
...basis.
So, for example, there were 11 supplementary volumes to the ninth Edition of the Encyclopaedia Britannica (1875-1889). These constituted the `tenth edition'.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
...format.
For example, the second edition of Nelson's Perpetual Loose Leaf Encyclopaedia of 1920. The Encyclopédie française is still available in loose-leaf format.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
...Internet.
We conceived of this solution in our effort to implement John Perry's suggestion that the Center for the Study of Language and Information develop an Internet encyclopedia of philosophy.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
...encyclopedia
The way we have set things up, each entry is given its own subdirectory in the entries directory, and that subdirectory is then linked into the author's home directory. So any files that the author transfers into that subdirectory can be accessed over the World Wide Web.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
...(CSCW)
See R. Baecker, Readings in Groupware and Computer Supported Cooperative Work: Assisting Human-Human Collaboration, Morgan Kaufman Press, 1993; R. Baecker, J. Grudin, W. Buxton, and S. Greenberg, (eds.), Human-Computer Interaction: Toward the Year 2000, Morgan Kaufman Press, 1995; S. Greenberg, (ed.), Computer-Supported Cooperative Work and Groupware, Academic Press, 1991; and I. Greif, (ed.), Computer-Supported Cooperative Work: A Book of Readings, Morgan Kaufman Press, 1988.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
...workspace'
Only the principal author of coauthored entries will have ftp access to an entry.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
...modifications.
To be absolutely safe, the Editor can always invoke superuser priveleges and prevent the author from further altering the file until the editing process is complete and a local backup is made.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
...members
If an author needs information about what topics the encyclopedia will include, this can be obtained directly by examining the Encyclopedia website or by asking the Editor.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
...system
See, for example, R. Medina-Mora, T. Winograd, R. Flores, and F. Flores, `The Action Workflow Approach to Workflow Management Technology', in Proceedings of the (1992) Conference on Computer Supported Cooperative Work, Association of Computing Machinery Press, 1992. It is unclear to us whether such software as the freely-distributed Egret (http://www.ics.hawaii.edu/~csdl/egret/) or the commercial Lotus `Notes' (http://www2.lotus.com/notes.nsf) would be helpful in this regard.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
...thereafter.
We have taken advantage of the UNIX `find' program; it is invoked in a script (`modifications') that runs each night and makes note of which entries have been changed in the past 24 hours. The `find' command is invoked with the following flags:
find entries -ctime -1 -name '*.html' -print

This causes `find' to print a list of all the HTML files in the `entries' directory that were altered in the last day. For each HTML file in the list, the `modifications' script then determines which Board member is responsible for the entry and places a time-stamped line in that Board member's log file (the log file is simply a list of entries along with the date they were modified and the author of the entry). On a fixed schedule, another script (`send-notifications') then sends the log file to the Board member in an email message. This notifies the Board member that he or she should evaluate the modified entries.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
...author.
For example, we are considering ways to use the UNIX `diff' command to tell us which lines in the file are different from the most recent backup copy. The problem with `diff' is the output, which is difficult to read. But there may be a way to convert the output into a more readable format.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
...content.
The annotations in the sourcefile consist of both instructions and comments. The instructions tell the authors how to eliminate the dummy content and replace it (by cutting and pasting) with the genuine content of their entries. The comments serve to indicate what the special HTML formatting commands are doing.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
...encyclopedia.
We have things arranged so that the author of the entry `entryname.html' will ftp that entry not just to his or her home directory, but to the special subdirectory of his or her home directory entitled `entryname'. This latter directory is created by our new-author script (see below) as a subdirectory of the entries directory and then linked into the author's home directory. Thus, any files the author ftp's into this special subdirectory are available to the httpd server.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
...parts:
We would like to thank Andrew Irvine, a Stanford Encyclopedia Board member, for his assistance in the formulation of the three parts to this Statement of Copyright.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
...server.
To be precise, we gave each author a login account with a home directory but made it impossible for the author to actually telnet, log on, and run processes on our machine. We did this by assigning a nonexistent UNIX shell `/bin/nosh' as their login shell. When an author ftp's to the machine, the ftp daemon checks to make sure that he or she has been assigned a login shell, but it doesn't require that the shell be a serviceable one. Thus, authors have ftp privileges to and from their home directories, but no login privileges, thereby reducing the load on our server and increasing security. Furthermore, each author's name not only serves to identify his or her home directory but also serves to identify a UNIX `group' (of users), of which only the author and the Editor are members. The author's home directory is assigned to this group, thus allowing only the author and the Editor write privileges to the author's home directory. Even if a password is stolen, at most one entry could be damaged.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
...drive.
The tape backup is on an incremental dump schedule, with a full dump occurring every two weeks. The daily backup onto the external disk makes a new copy of the users' home directories, the HTML sourcefiles of the encyclopedia entries, and the various programs and support data needed to run a web server.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
...is:
See Janice Walker. "MLA-Style Citations of Electronic Sources". Version 1.1. January, 1995 (Rev. 8/96). http://www.cas.usf.edu/english/walker/mla.html (May 12, 1997).}
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
...edition:
The idea of fixing a quarterly edition has the added virtue of providing quarterly deadlines for the authors. This might help the Editors set specific goals for the authors and timetables for completing certain sections of the Encyclopedia.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
...edition:
Actually, there are four copies, for a second copy of each entry is kept in the Editor's home directory on the principal computer. Whenever the Editor makes any modifications to an entry, a copy is immediately placed in this directory. By contrast, the backups on the external drive and tape drive are made once a day, in the early morning hours.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
...Internet.
If the Editor has no interest or skills in UNIX system administration, the computer consultant could be assigned these tasks as well.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
...does.
For example, we don't currently record when an entry is first put online, whether the last update was a substantive update to the content or an editorial update to fix poorly written HTML code, the amount of time elapsed since the entry was commissioned, how frequently the entry has been updated, when the Board member responsible for the entry last commented on it, etc. Given our limited budget, we have relied on our email record and and calendar to keep track of many of these transactions.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.
.

Ed Zalta
Thu Sep 12 11:44:00 PDT 1996