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Cognitive Science
Cognitive science is the interdisciplinary study of mind and
intelligence, embracing philosophy, psychology, artificial
intelligence, neuroscience, linguistics, and anthropology. Its
intellectual origins are in the mid-1950s when researchers in several
fields began to develop theories of mind based on complex
representations and computational procedures. Its organizational
origins are in the mid-1970s when the Cognitive Science Society was
formed and the journal Cognitive Science began. Since then, more than
sixty universities in North America and Europe have established
cognitive science programs and many others have instituted courses in
cognitive science.
Attempts to understand the mind and its operation go back at least to
the Ancient Greeks, when philosophers such as Plato and Aristotle tried
to explain the nature of human knowledge. The study of mind remained
the province of philosophy until the nineteenth century, when
experimental psychology developed. Wilhelm Wundt and his students
initiated laboratory methods for studying mental operations more
systematically. Within a few decades, however, experimental psychology
became dominated by behaviorism, a view that virtually denied the
existence of mind. According to behaviorists such as J. B. Watson,
psychology should restrict itself to examining the relation between
observable stimuli and observable behavioral responses. Talk of
consciousness and mental representations was banished from respectable
scientific discussion. Especially in North America, behaviorism
dominated the psychological scene through the 1950s. Around 1956, the
intellectual landscape began to change dramatically. George Miller
summarized numerous studies which showed that the capacity of human
thinking is limited, with short-term memory, for example, limited to
around seven items. He proposed that memory limitations can be overcome
by recoding information into chunks, mental representations that
require mental procedures for encoding and decoding the information. At
this time, primitive computers had been around for only a few years,
but pioneers such as John McCarthy, Marvin Minsky, Allen Newell, and
Herbert Simon were founding the field of artificial intelligence. In
addition, Noam Chomsky rejected behaviorist assumptions about language
as a learned habit and proposed instead to explain language
comprehension in terms of mental grammars consisting of rules. The six
thinkers mentioned in this paragraph can be viewed as the founders of
cognitive science.
The central hypothesis of cognitive science is that thinking can best
be understood in terms of representational structures in the mind and
computational procedures that operate on those structures. While there
is much disagreement about the nature of the representations and
computations that constitute thinking, the central hypothesis is
general enough to encompass the current range of thinking in cognitive
science, including connectionist theories which model thinking using
artificial neural networks.
Most work in cognitive science assumes that the mind has mental
representations analogous to computer data structures, and
computational procedures similar to computational algorithms. Cognitive
theorists have proposed that the mind contains such mental
representations as logical propositions, rules, concepts, images, and
analogies, and that it uses mental procedures such as deduction,
search, matching, rotating, and retrieval. The dominant mind-computer
analogy in cognitive science has taken on a novel twist from the use of
another analog, the brain. Connectionists have proposed novel ideas
about representation and computation that use neurons and their
connections as inspirations for data structures, and neuron firing and
spreading activation as inspirations for algorithms. Cognitive science
then works with a complex 3-way analogy among the mind, the brain, and
computers. Mind, brain, and computation can each be used to suggest new
ideas about the others. There is no single computational model of mind,
since different kinds of computers and programming approaches suggest
different ways in which the mind might work. The computers that most of
us work with today are serial processors, performing one instruction at
a time, but the brain and some recently developed computers are
parallel processors, capable of doing many operations at once.
Philosophy, in particular philosophy of mind, is part of cognitive
science. But the interdisciplinary field of cognitive science is
relevant to philosophy in several ways. First, the psychological,
computational, and other results of cognitive science investigations
have important potential applications to traditional philosophical
problems in epistemology, metaphysics, and ethics. Second, cognitive
science can serve as an object of philosophical critique, particularly
concerning the central assumption that thinking is representational and
computational. Third and more constructively, cognitive science can be
taken as an object of investigation in the philosophy of science,
generating reflections on the methodology and presuppositions of the
enterprise.
3.1 Philosophical Applications
Much philosophical research today is naturalistic, treating
philosophical investigations as continuous with empirical work in
fields such as psychology. From a naturalistic perspective, philosophy
of mind is closely allied with theoretical and experimental work in
cognitive science. Metaphysical conclusions about the nature of mind
are to be reached, not by a priori speculation, but by informed
reflection on scientific developments in fields such as computer
science and neuroscience. Similarly, epistemology is not a stand-alone
conceptual exercise, but depends on and benefits from scientific
findings concerning mental structures and learning procedures. Even
ethics can benefit by using greater understanding of the psychology of
moral thinking to bear on ethical questions such as the nature of
deliberations concerning right and wrong. Goldman (1993) provides a
concise review of applications of cognitive science to epistemology,
philosophy of science, philosophy of mind, metaphysics, and ethics.
3.2 Critique of Cognitive Science
The claim that human minds work by representation and computation is an
empirical conjecture and might be wrong. Although the
computational-representational approach to cognitive science has been
successful in explaining many aspects of human problem solving,
learning, and language use, some philosophical critics such as Hubert
Dreyfus and John Searle have claimed that this approach is
fundamentally mistaken. Critics of cognitive science have offered such
challenges as:
- The emotion challenge: Cognitive science neglects the important
role of emotions in human thinking.
- The consciousness challenge: Cognitive science ignores the
importance of consciousness in human thinking.
- The world challenge: Cognitive science disregards the significant
role of physical environments in human thinking.
- The social challenge: Human thought is inherently social in ways
that cognitive science ignores.
- The dynamical systems challenge: The mind is a dynamical system,
not a computational system.
- The mathematics challenge: Mathematical results show that human
thinking cannot be computational in the standard sense, so the brain
must operate differently, perhaps as a quantum computer.
Thagard (1996) argues that all these challenges can best be met by
expanding and supplementing the computational-representational
approach, not by abandoning it.
3.3 Philosophy of Cognitive Science
Cognitive science raises many interesting methodological questions that
are worthy of investigation by philosophers of science. What is the
nature of representation? What role do computational models play in the
development of cognitive theories? What is the relation among
apparently competing accounts of mind involving symbolic processing,
neural networks, and dynamical systems? Are psychological phenomena
subject to reductionist explanations via neuroscience? Von Eckardt
(1993) and Clark (2001) provide discussions of some of the
philosophical issues that arise in cognitive science. Bechtel et al.
(2001) collect useful articles on the philosophy of neuroscience.
- Bechtel, W., & Graham, G. (Eds.). (1998). A Companion to
Cognitive Science. Malden, MA: Blackwell.
- Bechtel, W., Mandik, P., Mundale, J., & Stufflebeam, R. S.
(Eds.). (2001). Philosophy and the Neurosciences: A Reader.
Malden, MA: Blackwell.
- Clark, A. (2001). Mindware: An Introduction to the Philosophy
of Cognitive science. New York: Oxford University Press.
- Dawson, M. R. W. (1998). Understanding Cognitive Science.
Oxford: Blackwell.
- Goldman, A. (1993). Philosophical Applications of Cognitive
Science. Boulder: Westview Press.
- Johnson-Laird, P., (1988). The Computer and the Mind: An
Introduction to Cognitive Science. Cambridge, MA: Harvard
University Press.
- Sobel, C. P. (2001). The Cognitive Sciences: An
Interdisciplinary Approach. Mountain View, CA: Mayfield.
- Stillings, N., et al., (1995). Cognitive Science. Second
edition. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
- Thagard, P., (1996). Mind: Introduction to Cognitive
Science, Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
[Table of Contents available online]
- von Eckardt, B. (1993). What is Cognitive Science?
Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
- Wilson, R. A., & Keil, F. C. (Eds.). (1999). The MIT
Encyclopedia of the Cognitive Sciences. Cambridge, MA: MIT
Press.
artificial intelligence |
behaviorism |
concepts |
connectionism |
consciousness |
emotion |
folk psychology: as a theory |
folk psychology: as mental simulation |
identity theory of mind |
innate/acquired distinction |
innate ideas |
intentionality |
language of thought hypothesis |
meaning holism |
memory |
mental content |
mental imagery |
mental representation |
mind: computational theory of |
mind: modularity of |
neuroscience, philosophy of |
propositional attitude reports
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Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy