Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Supplement to Moral Cognitivism vs. Non-Cognitivism
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Agent-Centered Teleology
There is a related worry about non-consequentialist judgements of
rightness. Certain moral theories require agents to maximize
agent-centered value (Broome 1991, 14-16). Thus such theories require a
distinct better-than relation for each agent. Egoism, for example,
requires that each agent bring about the outcome which is best for that
very same agent. What is good for one agent may not be good for
another. So egoism requires people to aim at different outcomes and, on
the assumption of teleology, to rank different outcomes as best. What
then is the non-cognitive attitude the egoist expresses? It isn't just
approval of or preference for actions that favor his or her own well
being, since the egoist is not an egotist – a person who thinks
that all agents should aim at his or her well-being (Dreier 1996b).
One solution is for the non-cognitivist to view the attitude in
question as a preference, but a preference between properties rather
than a preference between states of affairs individuated in a more
coarse-grained fashion. To prefer a property is to prefer to have that
property oneself, where the reference to oneself is essentially de se.
So to accept egoism is to accept a preference ordering in which I
prefer that Smith does well if I am Smith, that Jones does well if I am
Jones, and so on. These preferences will then explain why an egoist
prefers and aims at his or her own good (Dreier 1996b).
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