version history
|
Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
A |
B |
C |
D |
E |
F |
G |
H |
I |
J |
K |
L |
M |
N |
O |
P |
Q |
R |
S |
T |
U |
V |
W |
X |
Y |
Z
This document uses XHTML-1/Unicode to
format the display. Older browsers and/or operating systems may not
display the formatting correctly. |
|
last substantive content change
|
Supertasks
Supertasks have posed problems for philosophy since the time of Zeno
of Elea. The term ‘supertask’ is new but it designates an
idea already present in the formulation of the old motion paradoxes of
Zeno, namely the idea of an infinite number of actions performed in a
finite amount of time. The main problem lies in deciding what follows
from the performance of a supertask. Some philosophers have claimed
that what follows is a contradiction and that supertasks are,
therefore, logically impossible. Others have denied this conclusion,
and hold that the study of supertasks can help us improve our
understanding of the physical world, or even our theories about it.
A supertask may be defined as an infinite sequence of actions or
operations carried out in a finite interval of time. The terms
‘action’ and ‘operation’ must not be
understood in their usual sense, which involves a human agent. Human
agency may be involved but it is not necessary. To show this, let us
see how actions can be characterised precisely without any references
to man. We will assume that at each instant of time the state of the
world relevant to a specific action can be described by a set S of
sentences. Now an action or operation applied to a state of the world
results in a change in that state, that is, in the set S corresponding
to it. Consequently, an arbitrary action a will be defined (Allis and
Koetsier [1995]) as a change in the state of the world by which the
latter changes from state S before the change to state a(S) after it.
This means that an action has a beginning and an end, but does not
entail that there is a finite lapse of time between them. For
instance, take the case of a lamp that is on at t = 0 and remains so
until t = 1, an instant at which it suddenly goes off. Before t =1
the state of the lamp (which is the only relevant portion of the world
here) can be described by the sentence ‘lamp on’, and
after t =1 by the sentence ‘lamp off’, without there being
a finite lapse of time between the beginning and the end of the
action. Some authors have objected to this consequence of the
definition of action, and they might be right if we were dealing with
the general philosophical problem of change. But we need not be
concerned with those objections at this stage, since in the greatest
majority of the relevant supertasks instantaneous actions
(i.e. actions without any duration) can be replaced by actions lasting
a finite amount of time without affecting the analysis at any
fundamental point.
There is a particular type of supertask called hypertasks. A
hypertask is a non-numerable infinite sequence of actions or
operations carried out in a finite interval of time. Therefore, a
supertask which is not a hypertask will be a numerable infinite
sequence of actions or operations carried out in a finite interval of
time. Finally, a task can be defined as a finite sequence of actions
or operations carried out in a finite interval of time.
To gain a better insight into the fundamental nature of the
philosophical problem posed by supertasks, consider the distinction
between tasks in general (finite sequences of actions of the type
(a1, a2, a3, … ,
an)) and one particular type of supertasks, namely those
consisting of an infinite sequence of actions of the type
(a1, a2, a3, … ,
an, … ) and thus having the same type of order as
the natural order of positive integers: 1, 2, 3, … , n,
… (it is customary to denote this type of order with letter
‘w’ and so the related supertasks can be called
supertasks of type w).
In the case of a task T = (a1, a2,
a3, … , an) it is natural to say that T
is applicable in state S if:
a1 is applicable to S,
a2 is applicable to a1(S),
a3 is applicable to a2(a1(S)),
… , and,
an is applicable to an-1(an-2(…
(a2(a1(S)))… )).
The successive states of the world relevant to task T can be defined
by means of the finite sequence of sets of sentences:
S, a1(S), a2(a1(S)),
a3(a2(a1(S))), …,
an(an-1(an-2 (…
(a2(a1(S)))…))),
whose last term will therefore describe the relevant state of the
world after the performance of T. Or, equivalently, the state
resulting from applying T to S will be T(S) =
an(an-1(an-2
(… (a2(a1(S)))… ))).
Now take the case of a supertask T = (a1, a2,
a3, …, an, …). Let us give the
name Tn to the task which consists in performing the first
n actions of T. That is, Tn = (a1,
a2, a3, …, an). Now it is
natural to say that T is applicable in state S if Tn is
applicable in S for each natural number n, and, obviously,
Tn(S) = an(an-1(an-2
(…(a2(a1(S)))…))).
The successive states of the world relevant to supertask T can be
described by means of the infinite sequence of sets of sentences:
S, T1(S), T2(S), …, Tn(S),
…
A difficulty arises, however, when we want to specify the set of
sentences which describe the relevant state of the world after the
performance of supertask T, because the infinite sequence above lacks
a final term. Put equivalently, it is difficult to specify the
relevant state of the world resulting from the application of
supertask T to S because there seems to be no final state resulting
from such an application. This inherent difficulty is increased by
the fact that, by definition, supertask T is performed in a finite
time, and so there must exist one first instant of time t* at which it
can be said that the performance happened. Now notice that the world
must naturally be in a certain specific state at t*, which is the
state resulting from the application of T, but that, nevertheless, we
have serious trouble to specify this state, as we have just seen.
Since we have defined supertasks in terms of actions and actions in
terms of changes in the state of the world, there is a basic
indeterminacy regarding what type of processes taking place in time
should be considered supertasks, which is linked to the basic
indeterminacy that there is regarding which type of sets of sentences
are to be allowed in descriptions of the state of the world and which
are not. For this reason, there are some processes that would be
regarded as supertasks by virtually every philosopher and some about
which opinions differ. For an instance of the first sort of process,
take the one known as ‘Thomson's lamp’. Thomson's lamp is
basically a device consisting of a lamp and a switch set on an
electrical circuit. The switch can be in one of just two positions
and the lamp has got to be lit — when the switch is in position
‘on’ — or else dim — when the switch is in
position ‘off’. Assume that initially (at t = 12 A.M.,
say) the lamp is dim and that it is thenceforth subject to the
following infinite sequence of actions: when half of the time
remaining until t* = 1 P.M. has gone by, we carry out the action
a1 of turning the switch into position ‘on’
and, as a result, the lamp is lit (a1 is thus performed at
t = 1/2 P.M.); when half the time between the performance of
a1 and t* = 1 P.M. has gone by, we carry out action
a2 of turning to the switch into position ‘off’
and, as a result, the lamp is dim (a2 is thus performed at
t = 1/2 + 1/4 P.M.); when half the time between the performance of
a2 and t* = 1 P.M. has gone by, we carry out the action of
turning the switch into position ‘on’ and, as a result,
the lamp is lit (a3 is thus performed at t = 1/2 + 1/4 +
1/8), and so on. When we get to instant t* = 1 P.M. we will have
carried out an infinite sequence of actions, that is, a supertask T =
(a1, a2, a3, … ,
an, … ). If, for the sake of simplicity, we are
only concerned about the evolution of the lamp (not the switch) the
state of the world relevant to the description of our supertask admits
of only two descriptions, one through the unitary set of sentences
{lamp lit} and the other through the set {lamp dim}.
As an instance of the second sort of processes we referred to above,
those about which no consensus has been reached as to whether they are
supertasks, we can take the process which is described in one of the
forms of Zeno's dichotomy paradox. Suppose that initially (at t = 12
A.M., say) Achilles is at point A (x = 0) and moving in a
straight line, with a constant velocity v = 1 km/h, towards
point B (x = 1), which is 1 km. away from A. Assume, in
addition, that Achilles does not modify his velocity at any point. In
that case, we can view Achilles's run as the performance of a
supertask, in the following way: when half the time until t* = 1
P.M. has gone by, Achilles will have carried out the action
a1 of going from point x = 0 to point x = 1/2
(a1 is thus performed in the interval of time between t =12
A.M. and t = 1/2 P.M.), when half the time from the end of the
performance of a1 until t* = 1 P.M. will have elapsed,
Achilles will have carried out the action a2 of going from
point x = 1/2 to point x = 1/2 + 1/4 (a2 is
thus performed in the interval of time between t = 1/2 P.M. and t =
1/2 + 1/4 P.M.), when half the time from the end of the performance of
a2 until t* = 1 P.M. will have elapsed, Achilles will have
carried out the action a3 of going from point x =
1/2 + 1/4 to point x = 1/2 + 1/4 + 1/8 (a3 is thus
performed in the interval of time between t = 1/2 + 1/4 P.M. and t =
1/2 + 1/4 + 1/8 P.M.), and so on. When we get to instant t* = 1 P.M.,
Achilles will have carried out an infinite sequence of actions, that
is, a supertask T = (a1, a2, a3,
… , an, … ), provided we allow the state of
the world relevant for the description of T to be specified, at any
arbitrary instant, by a single sentence: the one which specifies
Achilles's position at that instant. Several philosophers have
objected to this conclusion, arguing that, in contrast to Thomson's
lamp, Achilles's run does not involve an infinity of actions (acts)
but of pseudo-acts. In their view, the analysis presented above for
Achilles's run is nothing but the breakdown of one process into a
numerable infinity of subprocesses, which does not make it into a
supertask. In Allis and Koetsier's words, such philosophers believe
that a set of position sentences is not always to be admitted as a
description of the state of the world relevant to a certain action.
In their opinion, a relevant description of a state of the world
should normally include a different type of sentences (as is the case
with Thomson's lamp) or, in any case, more than simply position
sentences.
In section 1.2 I have pointed out and illustrated the fundamental
philosophical problem posed by supertasks. Obviously, one will only
consider it a problem if one deems the concepts employed in its
formulation acceptable. In fact, some philosophers reject them,
because they regard the very notion of supertask as problematic, as
leading to contradictions or at least to insurmountable conceptual
difficulties. Among these philosophers the first well-known one is
Zeno of Elea.
Consider the dichotomy paradox in the formulation of it given in
section 1.3. According to Zeno, Achilles would never get to point B
(x = 1) because he would first have to reach the mid point of
his run (x = 1/2), after that he would have to get to the mid
point of the span which he has left (x = 1/2 + 1/4), and then
to the mid point of the span which is left (x = 1/2 + 1/4 +
1/8), and so on. Whatever the mid point Achilles may reach in his
journey, there will always exist another one (the mid point of the
stretch that is left for him to cover) that he has not reached yet.
In other words, Achilles will never be able to reach point B and
finish his run. According to Owen (Owen [1957-58]), in this as well
as in his other paradoxes, Zeno was concerned to show that the
Universe is a simple, global entity which is not comprised of
different parts. He tried to demonstrate that if we take to making
divisions and subdivisions we will obtain absurd results (as in the
dichotomy case) and that we must not yield to the temptation of
breaking up the world. Now the notion of supertask entails precisely
that, division into parts, as it involves breaking up a time interval
into successive intervals. Therefore, supertasks are not feasible in
the Zenonian world and, since they lead to absurd results, the notion
of supertask itself is conceptually objectionable.
In stark contrast to Zeno, the dichotomy paradox is standardly solved
by saying that the successive distances covered by Achilles as he
progressively reaches the mid points of the spans he has left to go
through — 1/2, 1/4, 1/8, 1/16, … — form an infinite
series 1/2 + 1/4 + 1/8 + 1/16 + … whose sum is 1.
Consequently, Achilles will indeed reach point B (x = 1) at t*
= 1 P.M. (which is to be expected if he travels with velocity v
= 1 km/h, as has been assumed). Then there is no problem whatsoever
in splitting up his run into smaller sub-runs and, so, no inherent
problem about the notion of supertask. An objection can be made,
however, to this standard solution to the paradox: it tells us where
Achilles is at each instant but it does not explain where Zeno's
argument breaks down. Importantly, there is another objection to the
standard solution, which hinges on the fact that, when it is claimed
that the infinite series 1/2 + 1/4 + 1/8 + 1/16 + … adds up to
1, this is substantiated by the assertion that the sequence of partial
sums 1/2, 1/2 + 1/4, 1/2 + 1/4 + 1/8, … has limit 1, that is,
that the difference between the successive terms of the sequence and
number 1 becomes progressively smaller than any positive integer, no
matter how small. But it might be countered that this is just a patch
up: the infinite series 1/2 + 1/4 + 1/8 + … seems to involve
infinite sums and thus the performance of a supertask, and the
proponent of the standard solution is in fact presupposing that
supertasks are feasible just in order to justifiy that they are. To
this the latter might reply that the assertion that the sum of the
series is 1 presupposes no infinite sum, since, by definition, the sum
of a series is the limit to which its partial (and so finite) sums
approach. His opponent can now express his disagreement with the
response that the one who supports the standard solution is deducing a
matter of fact (that Achilles is at x = 1 at t* = 1 P.M.) from
a definition pertaining to the arithmetic of infinite series, and that
it is blatantly unacceptable to deduce empirical propositions from
mere definitions.
Before concluding our discussion of the arguments connected with
Zeno's dichotomy paradox which have been put forward against the
conceptual feasibility of supertasks, we should deal with the
so-called inverse dichotomy of Zeno, which can also be formulated as a
supertask, but whose status as a logical possibility seems to some
philosophers to be even more doubtful than that of the direct version
expounded in section 2.1. The process involved in the paradox of
inverse dichotomy admits of a supertask kind of description, as
follows. Suppose that at t = 12 A.M. Achilles is at point A (x
= 0) and wishes to do the action of reaching point B (x = 1).
In order to do this action he must first of all go from point A to the
mid point b1 (x = 1/2) of the span AB that he wishes
to cover. In order to do this, he must in turn first do the action of
going from point A to the mid point b2 (x = 1/4) of
the span Ab1 that he wishes to cover, and so on . In order
to reach B, Achilles will have to accomplish an infinite sequence of
actions, that is, a supertask T* = (… , an, …
, a3, a2, a1), provided we allow the
state of the world relevant to the description of T* to be specified,
at a given arbitrary instant, by a single sentence, the one specifying
Achilles's position at that instant. Notice in the first place that
T* has the same type of order as the natural order of negative
integers: … , -n, … , -3, -2, -1 (such order type is
usually denoted with the expression ‘w*’ and the
related supertasks can therefore be called supertasks of type
w*). The philosophical problem connected with supertasks of
type w, already discussed in section 1.2 above, does not arise
now because the set of sentences which describes the relevant state of
the world after the performance of supertask T* is obviously
a1(S), with S the set of sentences describing the initial
relevant state of the world. But as the successive states of the
world after S in relation to T* can be described by means of the
infinite sequence of sets of sentences … , an(S),
… , a3(S), a2(S), a1(S), some
philosophers think it puzzling and unacceptable that the initial set
of sentences in that sequence cannot be specified. This really means
that we cannot specify which is the action in supertask T* that should
be carried out first and that we consequently ignore how to begin.
Isn't that proof enough that supertasks of type w* are
impossible? Chihara (1965), for example, says that Zeno's inverse
dichotomy is even more problematic than the direct one, since Achilles
is supposed to be capable of doing something akin to counting the
natural numbers in reverse order. In his opinion, it is just as
impossible for Achilles to start his run — if viewed as a
supertask of type w* — as it is to start this reverse
counting process.
Thomson (1954-55) was convinced that he could show supertasks to be
logically impossible. To this end, he made up the lamp example
analysed in section 1.3, since known as ‘Thomson's lamp’.
Thomson argued that the analysis of the workings of his lamp leads to
contradiction, and therefore the supertask involved is logically
impossible. But then, to the extent that this supertask is
representative of ‘genuine’ supertasks, all genuine
supertasks are impossible. Thomson's argument is simple. Let us ask
ourselves what the state of the lamp is at t* = 1 P.M. At that
instant the lamp cannot be lit, the reason being the way we manipulate
it: we never light the lamp without dimming it some time later. Nor
can the lamp be dim, because even if it is dim initially, we light it
and subsequently never dim it without lighting it back again some time
later. Therefore,at t* = 1 P.M. the lamp can be neither dim nor lit.
However, one of its functioning conditions is that it must be either
dim or lit. Thus, a contradiction arises. Conclusion: Thomson's lamp
or, better, the supertask consisting in its functioning is logically
impossible. Now is Thomson's argument correct? Benacerraf (1962)
detected a serious flaw in it. Let us in principle distinguish
between the series of instants of time in which the actions
ai of the supertask are performed (which will be called the
t-series) and the instant t* = 1 P.M., the first instant after the
supertask has been accomplished. Thomson's argument hinges on the way
we act on the lamp, but we only act on it at instants in the t-series,
and so what can be deduced logically from this way of acting will
apply only to instants in the t-series. As t* = 1 P.M. does not
belong to the t-series, it follows that Thomson's supposed conclusion
that the lamp cannot be lit at t* is fallacious, and so is his
conclusion that it cannot be dim at t*. The conditions obtaining in
the lamp problem only enable us to conclude that the lamp will be
either dim or else lit but not both at t* = 1 P.M., and this follows
from the fact that this exclusive disjunction was presupposed from the
start to be true at each and every instant of time, independently of
the way in which we could act on the lamp in the t-series of instants
of time. What cannot be safely inferred is which one of these two
states -dim or lit- the lamp will be in at t* = 1 P.M. or,
alternatively, the state of the lamp at t* = 1 P.M. is not logically
determined by what has happened before that instant. This consequence
tallies with what was observed in section 2.1 about the fallacy
committed by adherents to the standard solution against Zeno: they
seek to deduce that at instant t* = 1 P.M. Achilles will be at point B
from an analysis of the sub-runs performed by him before that instant,
that is, they assume that Achilles's state at t* follows logically
from his states at instants previous to t*, and in so assuming they
make the same mistake as Thomson.
Thomson (1954-55) put forward one more argument against the logical
possibility of his lamp. Let us assign to the lamp the value 0 when
it is dim and the value 1 when it is lit. Then lighting the lamp
means adding one unity (going from 0 to 1) and dimming it means
subtracting one unity (going from 1 to 0). It thus seems that the
final state of the lamp at t* = 1 P.M., after an infinite, and
alternating, sequence of lightings (additions of one unity) and
dimmings (subtractions of one unity), should be described by the
infinite series 1-1+1-1+1… If we accept the conventional
mathematical definition of the sum of a series, this series has no
sum, because the partial sums 1, 1-1, 1-1+1, 1-1+1-1, … ,
etc. take on the values 1 and 0 alternatively, without ever
approaching a definite limit that could be taken to be the proper sum
of the series. But in that case it seems that the final state of the
lamp can neither be dim (0) nor lit (1), which contradicts our
assumption that the lamp is at all times either dim or lit.
Benacerraf's (1962) reply was that even though the first, second,
third, … , n-th partial sum of the series 1-1+1-1+1…
does yield the state of the lamp after one, two, three, … , n
actions ai (of lighting or dimming), it does not follow
from this that the final state of the lamp after the infinite sequence
of actions ai must of necessity be given by the sum of the
series, that is, by the limit to which its partial sums progressively
approach. The reason is that a property shared by the partial sums of
a series does not have to be shared by the limit to which those
partial sums tend. For instance, the partial sums of the series 0.3 +
0.03 + 0.003 + 0.0003 + … are 0.3, 0.3 + 0.03 = 0.33, 0.3 +
0.03 + 0.003 = 0.333,… , all of them, clearly, numbers less
than 1/3; however, the limit to which those partial sums tend (that
is, the sum of the original series) is 0.3333… , which is
precisely the number 1/3.
Another one of the classical arguments against the logical possibility
of supertasks comes from Black (1950-51) and is constructed around the
functioning of an infinity machine of his own invention. An infinity
machine is a machine that can carry out an infinite number of actions
in a finite time. Black's aim is to show that an infinity machine is
a logical impossibility. Consider the case of one such machine whose
sole task is to carry a ball from point A (x = 0) to point B
(x = 1) and viceversa. Assume, in addition, that initially (at
t = 12 A.M., say) the ball is at A and that the machine carries out
the following infinite sequence of operations: when half the time
until t* = 1 P.M. has gone by, it does the action a1 of
taking the ball from position A to position B (a1 is thus
carried out at t = 1/2 P.M.); when half the time between the
performance of a1 and t* = 1 P.M. has gone by, it does the
action a2 of taking the ball from position B to position A
(a2 is thus carried out at t = 1/2 + 1/4 P.M.); when half
the time between the performance of a2 and t* = 1 P.M. has
gone by, the machine does the action a3 of taking the ball
from position A to position B (a3 is thus performed in t =
1/2 + 1/4 + 1/8 P.M.), and so on. When we get to instant t* = 1
P.M. the machine will have carried out an infinite sequence of
actions, that is, a supertask T = (a1, a2,
a3, … , an, … ). The parallelism
with Thomson's lamp is clear when it is realised that the ball in
position A corresponds to the dim lamp and the ball in position B
corresponds to the lit lamp. Nevertheless, Black believes that by
assuming that at each instant the ball is either in A or else in B
(and note that assuming this means that the machine transports the
ball from A to B and viceversa instantaneously, but we need not be
worried by this, since all that we are concerned with now is logical
or conceptual possibility, not physical possibility), he can deduce,
by a totally different route from Thomson's based on the symmetrical
functioning of his machine, a contradiction regarding its state at t*
= 1 P.M.. However, Benacerraf's criticisms also applies to Black's
argument. In effect, the latter hinges on how the machine works, and
as this has only been specified for instants of time previous to t* =
1 P.M., it follows that what can be logically inferred from the
functioning of the machine is only applicable to those instants
previous to t* = 1 P.M.. Black seeks to deduce a contradiction at t*
= 1 P.M. but he fails at the same point as Thomson: whatever happens
to the ball at t* = 1 P.M. cannot be a logical consequence of what has
happened to it before. Of course, one can always specify the
functioning of the machine for instants t greater than or equal to 1
P.M. by saying that at all those instants the machine will not perform
any actions at all, but that is not going to help Black. His argument
is fallacious because he seeks to reach a logical conclusion regarding
instant t* = 1 P.M. from information relative to times previous to
that instant.. In the standard argument against Zeno's dichotomy one
could similarly specify Achilles's position at t* = 1 P.M. saying, for
instance, that he is at B (x = 1), but there is no way that
this is going to get us a valid argument out of a fallacious one,
which seeks to deduce logically where Achilles will be at t* = 1
P.M. from information previous to that instant of time.
The cases dealt with above are examples of how Benacerraf's strategy
can be used against supposed demonstrations of the logical
impossibility of supertasks. We have seen that the strategy is based
on the idea that
(I) the state of a system at an instant t* is not a logical
consequence of which states he has been in before t* (where by
‘state’ I mean ‘relevant state of the world’,
see section 1.1)
and occasionally on the idea that
(II) the properties shared by the partial sums of a series do not
have to be shared by the limit to which those partial sums tend.
Since the partial sums of a series make up a succession (of partial
sums), (II) may be rewritten as follows:
(III) the properties shared by the terms of a
succession do not have to be shared by the limit to which that
succession tends.
If we keep (I), (II) and (III) well in mind, it is easy not to yield
to the perplexing implications of certain supertasks dealt with in the
literature. And if we do not yield to the perplexing results, we will
also not fall into the trap of considering supertasks conceptually
impossible. (III), for instance, may be used to show that it is not
impossible for Achilles to perform the supertasks of the inverse and
the direct dichotomy of Zeno. Take the case of the direct dichotomy:
the limit of the corresponding succession of instants of time
t1, t2, t3, … at which each
one of Achilles's successive sub-runs is finished can be the instant
at which Achilles's supertask has been accomplished, even if such a
supertask is not achieved at any one of the instants in the infinite
succession t1, t2, t3, … (all
of this in perfect agreement with (III)).
As a corollary it may be said that supertasks do not seem to be
intrinsically impossible. The contradictions that they supposedly
give rise to may be avoided if one rejects certain unwarranted
assumptions that are usually made. The main such assumption,
responsible for the apparent conceptual impossibility of supertasks,
is that properties which are preserved after a finite number of
actions or operations will likewise be preserved after an infinite
number of them. But that is not true in general. For example, we saw
in section 1.2 above that the relevant state of the world after the
performance of a task T = (a1, a2, … ,
an) on the relevant state S was logically determined by T
and by S (and was
an(an-1(an-2(…
(a2(a1(S)))…)))), but we have now learned
that after the performance of a supertask T = (a1,
a2, a3, …, an, …) it is
not (that is the core of Benacerraf's critique). The same sort of
uncritical assumptions seem to be in the origin of infinity paradoxes
in general, in which certain properties are extrapolated from the
finite to the infinite that are only valid for the finite, as when it
is assumed that there must be more numbers greater than zero than
numbers greater than 1000 because all numbers greater than 1000 are
also greater than zero but not viceversa (Galileo's paradox). In
conclusion, if some supertasks are paradoxical, it is not because of
any inherent inconsistency of the notion of supertask. This opinion
is adhered to by authors such as Earman and Norton (1996).
We have gone through several arguments for the conceptual
impossibility of supertasks and counterarguments to these. Those who
hold that supertasks are conceptually possible may however not agree
as to whether they are also physically possible. In general, when
this issue is discussed in the literature, by physical possibility is
meant possibility in relation with certain broad physical principles,
laws or ‘circumstances’ which seems to operate in the real
world, at least as far as we know. But it is a well-known fact that
authors do not always agree about which those principles, laws or
circumstances are.
In our model of Thomson's lamp we are assuming that at each moment the
switch can be in just one of two set positions (‘off’,
‘on’). If there is a fixed distance d between them, then
clearly, since the switch swings an infinite number of times from the
one to the other from t = 12 A.M. until t* = 1 P.M., it will have
covered an infinite distance in one hour. For this to happen it is
thus necessary for the speed with which the switch moves to increase
unboundedly during this time span. Grünbaum has taken this
requirement to be physically impossible to fulfil. Grünbaum
(1970) believes that there is a sort of physical impossibility of a
purely kinematical nature (kinematical impossibility) and describes it
in more precise terms by saying that a supertask is kinematically
impossible if:
a) At least one of the moving bodies travels at an unboundedly
increasing speed,
b) For some instant of time t*, the position of at least one of the
moving bodies does not approach any defined limit as we get
arbitrarily closer in time to t*.
It is clear then that the Thomson's lamp supertask, in the version
presented so far, is kinematically (and eo ipso physically)
impossible, since not only does the moving switch have to travel at a
speed that increases unboundedly but also -because it oscillates
between two set positions which are a constant distance d apart- its
position does not approach any definite limit as we get closer to
instant t* = 1 P.M., at which the supertask is accomplished.
Nevertheless, Grünbaum has also shown models of Thomson's lamp
which are kinematically possible. Take a look at Figure 1, in which
the switch (in position ‘on’ there) is simply a segment AB
of the circuit connecting generator G with lamp L. The circuit
segment AB can shift any distance upwards so as to open the circuit in
order for L to be dimmed. Imagine we push the switch successively
upwards and downwards in the way illustrated in Figure 2, so that it
always has the same velocity v = 1.
Figure 1
Figure 2
The procedure is the following. Initially (t = 0) the switch is in
position A′B′ (lamp dim) a height of 0.2 above the circuit
and moving downwards (at v = 1). At t = 0.2 it will be in
position AB (lamp lit) and will begin moving upwards (v = 1).
At t = 0.2 + 0.01 it will be in position A″B″ (lamp dim)
and will begin moving downwards (v = 1). At t = 0.2 + 0.01 +
0.01 = 0.2 + 0.02 it will be in position AB (lamp lit) and will begin
moving upwards (v = 1). At t = 0.2 + 0.02 + 0.001 it will be
in position A′′′B′′′ (lamp dim),
and so on. Obviously, between t = 0 and t* = 0.2 + 0.02 + 0.002 +
… = 0.2222… = 2/9, the lamp is in the states
‘dim’ and ‘lit’ an infinite number of times,
and so a supertask is accomplished. But this supertask is not
kinematically impossible, because it has been so designed that the
switch always moves with velocity v = 1 — and, therefore,
condition (a) for kinematical impossibility is not fulfilled —
and that, additionally, as we get closer to the limit time t* = 2/9
(the only one which could cause us any trouble) the switch approaches
more and more a well-defined limit position, position AB (lamp lit)
-and, therefore, condition b) for kinematical impossibility is not
fulfilled either. Once the kinematical possibility has been
established, what is the state of the lamp at t* = 2/9? What has been
said so far does not enable us to give a determinate answer to this
question (just as the obvious kinematical possibility of Achilles's
supertask in the dichotomy paradox does not suffice to determine where
Achilles will be at t* = 1 P.M.), but there exists a
‘natural’ result. It seems intuitively acceptable that
the position the switch will occupy at t* = 2/9 will be position AB,
and so the lamp will be lit at that instant. There is no mysterious
asymmetry about this result. Figure 3 shows a model of Thomson's lamp
with a switch that works according to exactly the same principles as
before, but which will yield the ‘natural’ result that the
lamp will in the end be dim at t* = 2/9. In effect, the switch will
now finally end up in the ‘natural’ position AB at t* =
2/9 and will thereby bring about an electrical short-circuit that will
make all the current in the generator pass through the cable on which
the switch is set, leaving nothing for the more resistant path where
the lamp is.
Figure 3
There are some who believe that the very fact that there exist
Thomson's lamps yielding an intuitive result of ‘lamp lit’
when the supertask is accomplished but also other lamps whose
intuitive result is ‘lamp dim’ brings up back to the
contradiction which Thomson thought to have found originally. But we
have nothing of that sort. What we do have is different physical
models with different end-results. This does not contradict but
rather corroborates the results obtained by Benacerraf: the final
state is not logically determined by the previous sequence of states
and operations. This logical indeterminacy can indeed become physical
determinacy, at least sometimes, depending on what model of Thomson's
lamp is employed.
A conspicuous instance of a supertask which is kinematically
impossible is the one performed by Black's infinity machine, whose
task it is to transport a ball from position A (x = 0) to
position B (x = 1) and from B to A an infinite number of times
in one hour. As with the switch in our first model of Thomson's lamp,
it is obvious that the speed of the ball increases unboundedly (and so
condition a) for impossibility is met), while at the same time, as we
approach t* = 1 P.M., its position does not tend to any defined limit,
due to the fact that it must oscillate continuously between two set
positions A and B one unity distance apart from each other (and so
also condition b) for impossibility is met).
Up to this point we have seen examples of supertasks which are
conceptually possible and, among these, we have discovered some which
are also physically possible. For the latter to happen we had to make
sure that at least some requirements were complied with which,
plausibly, characterise the processes that can actually take place in
our world. But some definitive statement remains to be made about the
philosophical problem posed by supertasks: what the state of the world
is after they have been accomplished. The principles of physical
nature which have so far been appealed to do not enable us to
pronounce on this matter. The question thus arises whether some new
principle of a physical nature can be discovered which holds in the
real world and is instrumental in answering the question what the
state of the world will be after a supertask. That discovery would
allow us to resolve a radical indeterminacy which still persists -the
reader will remember that even in the case of Achilles's dichotomy
supertask we were quite unable to prove that it would conclude with
Achilles in point B (x = 1). In Section 2.1 we saw that such
proof cannot be obtained by recourse to the mathematical theory of
infinite series exclusively; why should it be assumed that this
abstract theory is literally applicable to the physical universe?
After all, amounts of money are added up applying ordinary arithmetic
but, as Black reminded us, velocities cannot be added up according to
ordinary arithmetic.
Since Benacerraf's critique, we know that there is no logical
connection between the position of Achilles at t* = 1 P.M. and his
positions at instants previous to t* = 1 P.M. Sainsbury [1988] has
tried to bridge the gap opened by Benacerraf. He claims that this can
be achieved by drawing a distinction between abstract space of a
mathematical kind and physical space. No distinction between
mathematical and physical space has to be made, however, to attain
that goal; one need only appeal to a single principle of physical
nature, which is, moreover, simple and general, namely, that the
trajectories of material bodies are continuous lines. To put it more
graphically, what this means is that we can draw those trajectories
without lifting our pen off the paper. More precisely, that the
trajectory of a material body is a continuous line means that,
whatever the instant t, the limit to which the position occupied by
the body tends as time approaches t coincides precisely with the
position of the body at t. Moreover, the principle of continuity is
highly plausible as a physical hypothesis: the trajectories of all
physical bodies in the real world are in fact continuous. What
matters is that we realise that, aided by this principle, we can now
finally demonstrate that after the accomplishment of the dichotomy
supertask, that is, at t* = 1 P.M., Achilles will be in point B
(x = 1). We know, in fact, that as the time Achilles has spent
running gets closer and closer to t* = 1 P.M., his position will
approach point x = 1 more and more, or, equivalently, we know
that the limit to which the position occupied by Achilles tends as
time get progressively closer to t* = 1 P.M. is point B (x =
1). As Achilles's trajectory must be continuous, by the definition of
continuity (applied to instant t = t* = 1 P.M.) we obtain that the
limit to which the position occupied by Achilles tends as time
approaches t* = 1 P.M. coincides with Achilles's position at t* = 1
P.M. Since we also know that this limit is point B (x = 1), it
finally follows that Achilles's position at t* = 1 P.M. is point B
(x = 1). Now is when we can spot the flaw in the standard
argument against Zeno mentioned in section 2.1, which was grounded on
the observation that the sequence of distances covered by Achilles
(1/2, 1/2 + 1/4, 1/2 + 1/4 + 1/8, … ) has 1 as its limit. This
alone does not suffice to conclude that Achilles will reach point
x = 1, unless it is assumed that if the distances run by
Achilles have 1 as their limit, then Achilles will as a matter of fact
reach x = 1, but assuming this entails using the principle of
continuity. This principle affords us a rigorous demonstration of
what, in any event, was already plausible and intuitively
‘natural’: that after having performed the infinite
sequence of actions (a1, a2, a3,
… , an, … ) Achilles will have reached point
B (x = 1). In addition, now it is easy to show how, with a
switch like the one in Figure 2, Thomson's lamp in Figure 1 will reach
t* = 2/9 with its switch in position AB and will therefore be lit. We
have in fact already pointed out (3.1) that in this case, as we get
closer to the limit time t* = 2/9, the switch indefinitely approaches
a well-defined limit position -position AB. Due to the fact that the
principle of continuity applies to the switch, because it is a
physical body, this well-defined limit position must coincide
precisely with the position of the switch at t* = 2/9. Therefore, at
t* = 2/9 the latter will be in positon AB and, consequently, the lamp
will be lit. By the same token, it can also be shown that the lamp in
Figure 3 will be dim at time t* = 2/9.
In Section 3.2, the principle of continuity helped us find the final
state resulting from the accomplishment of a supertask in cases in
which there exists a ‘natural’ limit for the state of the
physical system involved as time progressively approaches the instant
at which the supertask is achieved. Now it is considerably more
problematic to apply this principle to supertasks for which there is
no ‘natural’ limit. For an example, let us consider
Black's infinity machine, introduced in Section 2.4, and let us ask
ourselves where the ball will be at instant t* = 1 P.M. at which the
supertask is achieved. We can set up a reductio ad absurdum type of
argument, as follows. Assume that at t* = 1 P.M. the ball were to
occupy position P, that it was in point P. According to the principle
of continuity, it follows that the limit to which the position
occupied by the ball tends as time approaches t* = 1 P.M. is precisely
position P. We know, though, that Black's infinity machine makes the
ball oscillate more and more quickly between the fixed points A
(x = 0) and B (x = 1) as we get closer to t* = 1 P.M.,
so the position of the ball does not approach any definite limit as we
get closer to t* = 1 P.M. This conclusion patently contradicts what
follows from the principle of continuity. Therefore, the assumption
that, after Black's supertask is achieved (t* = 1 P.M.), the ball is
at point P leads to contradiction with the principle of continuity.
Thus, the ball cannot be at point P at t* = 1 P.M., and as the point
can be any, given that it has been chosen arbitrarily, the ball cannot
be at any single one of the points, which means that at t* = 1
P.M. the ball has ceased to exist. This funny conclusion is
consistent with the principle of continuity, as we have just seen, but
it enters into contradiction with what could be termed the
‘postulate of permanence’: no material body (and by that
we mean a given quantity of matter) can go out of existence all of a
sudden, without leaving any traces. The postulate of permanence seems
to characterise our world at least as evidently as the principle of
continuity. Notice in particular that certain physical bodies
(particles) may dematerialise, but that is not inconsistent with the
postulate of permanence since such a dematerialisation leaves an
energy trace (which is not true of Black's ball). Consequently, we
can see that the case Black's infinity machine is one in which the
principles of continuity and permanence turn out to be mutually
inconsistent. As long as we do not give up any of them, we are forced
to accept that such an infinity machine is physically impossible.
As we do not know exactly what laws of nature there are, it goes
without saying that the question whether a particular supertask is
physically possible (that is, compatible with those laws) cannot be
given a definitive answer in general. What we have done in 3 above is
rather to set out necessary conditions for physical possibility which
are plausible (such as the principle of continuity) and sufficient
conditions for physical impossibility which are likewise plausible
(such as Grünbaum's criterion of kinematical impossibility). In
this section we shall look into a problem related to the one just
dealt with, but one to which a definitive answer can be given: the
problem of deciding whether a certain supertask is possible within the
framework of a given physical theory, that is, whether it is
compatible with the principles of that theory. These are two distinct
problems. At this stage our object are theories whereas in 3 above we
were concerned with the real world. What we are after is supertasks
formulated within the defined framework of a given physical theory
which can tell us something exciting and/or new about that theory. We
will discover that this search will lead us right into the heart of
basic theoretical problems.
Classical dynamics is a theory that studies the motion of physical
bodies which interact among themselves in various ways. The vast
majority of interesting examples of supertasks within this theory have
been elaborated under the assumption that the particles involved only
interact with one another by means of elastic collisions, that is,
collisions in which no energy is dissipated. We shall see here that
supertasks of type w* give rise to a new form of
indeterministic behaviour of dynamical systems. The most simple type
of case (Pérez Laraudogoitia [1996]) is illustrated by the
particle system represented in Figure 4 at three distinct moments. It
consists of an infinite set of identical point particles
P1, P2, P3, … , Pn,
… arranged in a straight line. Take the situation depicted in
Figure 4A first. In it P1 is at one unity distance from
the coordinate origin O, P2 at a distance 1/2 of O,
P3 at a distance 1/3 of O and so on. In addition, let it
be that all the particles are at rest, except for P1, which
is approaching O with velocity v = 1. Suppose that all this
takes place at t = 0. Now we will employ
Figure 4
the well-known dynamic theorem by which if two identical particles
undergo an elastic collision then they will exchange their velocities
after colliding. If our particles P1, P2,
P3, … collide elastically, it is easy to predict
what will happen after t = 0 with the help of this theorem. In the
event that P1 were on its own, it would reach O at t = 1,
but in fact it will collide with P2 and lie at rest there,
while P2 will acquire velocity v = 1. If
P1 and P2 were on their own, then it would be
P2 that would reach O at t = 1, but P2 will in
fact collide with P3, and lie at rest there, while
P3 will acquire velocity v = 1. Again, it can be
said that if P1, P2 and P3 were on
their own, then it is P3 that would reach O at t = 1, but
in actual fact it will collide with P4 and lie at rest
there, while P4 will acquire velocity v = 1, and so
on. From the foregoing it follows that no particle will get to O at t
= 1, because it will be impeded by a collision with another particle.
Therefore, at t = 1 all the particles will already lie at rest, which
yields the configuration in Figure 4B. Since P1 stopped
when it collided with P2, it will occupy the position
P2 had initially (at t = 0). Similarly, P2
stopped after colliding with P3 and so it will occupy the
position P3 had initially (at t = 0), … , etc. If
we view each collision as an action (which is plausible, since it
involves a sudden change of velocities), it turns out that between t =
0 and t = 1 our evolving particle system has performed a supertask of
type w. The second dynamic theorem we will make use of says
that if a dynamic process is possible, then the process resulting from
inverting the direction in which all the bodies involved in it move is
also possible. Applying this to our case, if the process leading from
the system in the situation depicted in Figure 4A to the situation
depicted in Figure 4B is possible (and we have just seen it is), then
the process obtained by simply inverting the direction in which the
particles involved move will also be possible. This new possible
process does not bring the system from configuration 4B back to
configuration 4A but rather changes it into configuration 4C (as the
direction in which P1 moves must be inverted). As the
direct process lasts one time unity (from t = 0 to t = 1), so will the
inverse process, and as in the direct process the system performs a
supertask of type w, in the inverse process it will perform one
of type w*. What is interesting about this new supertask of
type w*? What's interesting is that it takes the system from a
situation (4B) in which all its component particles are at rest to
another situation (4C) in which not all of them are. This means that
the system has self-excited, because no external influence has been
exerted on it, and, what is more, it has done so spontaneously and
unpredictably, because the supertask can set off at any instant and
there is no way of predicting when it will happen. We have found a
supertask of type w* to be the source of a new form of
dynamical indeterminism. The reason we speak of indeterminism is
because there is no initial movement to the performance of the
supertask. The system self-excites in such a way that each particle
is set off by a collision with another one, and it is the ordinal type
w* of the sequence of collisions accomplished in a finite time
that guarantees movement, without the need for a ‘prime
mover’. Now movement without a ‘prime mover’ is
precisely what characterises the dynamical indeterminism linked to
supertasks of type w*.
Within relativity theory, supertasks have been approached from a
radically different perspective from the one adopted here so far. This
new perspective is inherently interesting, since it links the problem
of supertasks up with the relativistic analysis of the structure of
space-time. To get an insight into the nature of that connection, let
us first notice that, according to the theory of relativity, the
duration of a process will not be the same in different reference
systems but will rather vary according to the reference system within
which it is measured. This leaves open the possibility that a process
which lasts an infinite amount of time when measured within reference
system O may last a finite time when measured within a different
reference system O'.
The supertask literature has needed to exploit space-times with
sufficiently complicated structure that global reference systems
cannot be defined in them. In these and other cases, the time of a
process can be represented by its ‘proper time’. If we
represent a process by its world-line in space-time, the proper time
of the process is the time read by a good clock that moves with the
process along its world-line. A familiar example of its use is the
problem of the twins in special relativity. One twin stays home on
earth and grows old. Forty years of proper time, for example, elapses
along his world-line. The travelling twin accelerates off into space
and returns to find his sibling forty years older. But much less time
— say only a year of proper time — will have elapsed along
the travelling twin world-line if he has accelerated to sufficiently
great speeds.
If we take this into account it is easily seen that the definition of
supertask that we have been using is ambiguous. In section 1 above we
defined a supertask as an infinite sequence of actions or operations
carried out in a finite interval of time. But we have not specified
in whose proper time we measure the finite interval of time. Do we
take the proper time of the process under consideration? Or do we
take the proper time of some observer who watches the process? It
turns out that relativity theory allows the former to be infinite
while the latter is finite. This fact opens new possibilities for
supertasks. Relativity theory thus forces us to disambiguate our
definition of supertask, and there is actually one natural way to do
it. We can use Black's idea — presented in 2.4 — of an
infinity machine, a device capable of performing a supertask, to
redefine a supertask as an infinite sequence of actions or operations
carried out by an infinity machine in a finite interval of the
machine's own proper time measured within the reference system
associated to the machine. This redefinition of the notion of
supertask does not change anything that has been said until now; our
whole discussion remains unaffected so long as ‘finite interval
of time’ is read as ‘finite interval of the machine's
proper time’. This notion of supertask, disambiguated so as to
accord with relativity theory, will be denoted by the expression
‘supertask-1’. Thus:
Supertask-1: an infinite sequence of actions or operations carried
out by an infinity machine in a finite interval of the machine's
proper time.
However we might also imagine a machine that carries out an infinite
sequence of actions or operations in an infinite machine proper time,
but that the entire process can be seen by an observer in a finite
amount of the observer's proper time.
It is convenient at this stage to introduce a contrasting notion:
Supertask-2: an infinite sequence of actions or operations carried
out by a machine in a finite interval of an observer's proper time.
While we did not take relativity theory into account, the notions of
supertask-1 and supertask-2 coincided. The duration of an interval of
time between two given events is the same for all observers. However
in relativistic spacetimes this is no longer so and the two notions of
supertasks become distinct. Even though all supertasks-1 are also
supertasks-2, there may in principle be supertasks-2 which are not
supertasks-1. For instance, it could just so happen that there is a
machine (not necessarily an infinity machine) which carries out an
infinite number of actions in an interval of its own proper time of
infinite duration, but in an interval of some observer's proper time
of finite duration. Such a machine would have performed a supertask-2
but not a supertask-1.
The distinction between supertasks-1 and supertasks-2 is certainly
no relativistic hair-splitting. Why? Because those who hold that,
while conceptually possible, supertasks are physically impossible
(this seems to be the position adopted by Benacerraf and Putnam
[1964], for instance) usually mean that supertasks-1 are physically
impossible. But from this, it does not follow that supertasks-2 must
also be physically impossible. Relativity theory thus adds a
brand-new, exciting extra dimension to the challenge presented by
supertasks. Earman and Norton (1996), who have studied this issue
carefully, use the name ‘bifurcated supertasks’ to refer
specifically to supertasks-2 which are not supertasks-1, and I will
adopt this term.
What shape does the philosophical problem posed by supertasks —
introduced in Section 1.2 — take on now? Remember that the
problem lay in specifying the set of sentences which describe the
state of the world after the supertask has been performed. The
problem will now be to specify the set of sentences which describe the
relevant state of the world after the bifurcated supertask has been
performed. Before this can done, of course, the question needs to be
answered whether a bifurcated supertask is physically possible. Given
that we agree that compatibility with relativity theory is a necessary
and sufficient condition of physical possibility, we can reply in the
affirmative.
Pitowsky (1990) first showed how this compatibility might arise. He
considered a Minkowski spacetime, the spacetime of special relativity.
He showed that an observer O* who can maintain a sufficient increase
in his acceleration will find that only a finite amount of proper time
elapses along his world-line in the course of the complete history of
the universe, while other unaccelerated observers would find an
infinite proper time elapsing on theirs.
Let us suppose that some machine M accomplishes a bifurcated
supertask in such a way that the infinite sequence of actions involved
happens in a finite interval of an observer O's proper time. If we
imagine such an observer at some event on his world-line, all those
events from which he can retrieve information are in the ‘past
light cone’ of the observer. That is, the observer can receive
signals travelling at or less than the speed of light from any event
in his past light cone. The philosophical problem posed by the
bifurcated supertask accomplished by M has a particularly simple
solution when the infinite sequence of actions carried out by M is
fully contained within the past light cone of an event on observer O's
world-line. In such a case the relevant state of the world after the
bifurcated supertask has been performed is M's state, and this, in
principle, can be specified, since O has causal access to it.
Unfortunately, a situation of this type does not arise in the simple
bifurcated supertask devised by Pitowsky (1990). In his supertask,
while the accelerated observer O* will have a finite upper bound on
the proper time elapsed on his world-line, there will be no event on
his world-line from which he can look back and see an infinity of time
elapsed along the world-line of some unaccelerated observer.
To find a spacetime in which the philosophical problem posed by
bifurcated supertasks admits of the simple solution that has just been
mentioned, we will move from the flat spacetime of special relativity
to the curved spacetimes of general relativity. One type of spacetime
in the latter class that admits of this simple solution has been
dubbed Malament-Hogarth spacetime, from the names of the first
scholars to use them (Hogarth [1992]). An example of such a spacetime
is an electrically charged black hole (the Reissner-Nordstroem
spacetime). A well known property of black holes is that, in the view
of those who remain outside, unfortunates who fall in appear to freeze
in time as they approach the event horizon of the black hole. Indeed
those who remain outside could spend an infinite lifetime with the
unfortunate who fell in frozen near the event horizon. If we just
redescribe this process from the point of view of the observer who
does fall in to the black hole, we discover that we have a bifurcated
supertask. The observer falling in perceives no slowing down of time
in his own processes. He sees himself reaching the event horizon
quite quickly. But if he looks back at those who remain behind, he
sees their processes sped up indefinitely. By the time he reaches the
event horizon, those who remain outside will have completed infinite
proper time on their world-lines. Of course, the cost is high. The
observer who flings himself into a black hole will be torn apart by
tidal forces and whatever remains after this would be unable to return
to the world in which he started.
The possibility of supertasks has interesting consequences for the
philosophy of mathematics. To start with, take a well-known unsolved
mathematical problem, for example that of knowing whether Goldbach's
conjecture is or is not correct. Goldbach's conjecture asserts that
any even number greater than 2 is the sum of two prime numbers.
Nobody has been capable of showing whether this is true yet, but if
supertasks are possible, that question can be resolved. Let us, to
that effect, perform the supertask of type w consisting in the
following sequence of actions: action a1 involves checking
whether the first pair greater than 2 (number 4) is the sum of two
prime numbers or not; let this action be accomplished at t = 0.3 P.M.;
action a2 involves checking whether the second pair greater
than 2 (number 6) is the sum of two prime numbers or not; let this
action be accomplished at t = 0.33 P.M.; action a3 involves
checking whether the third pair greater than 2 (number 8) is the sum
of two prime numbers or not; let this action be accomplished at t =
0.333 P.M., and so on. It is clear that at t = 0.33333… = 1/3
P.M., the instant at which the supertask has already been performed,
we will have checked all the pairs greater than 2, and, therefore,
will have found some which is not the sum of two prime numbers or else
will have found all of them to be the sum of two prime numbers. In
the first case, we will know at t = 1/3 P.M. that Goldbach's
conjecture is false; in the seocnd case we will know at t = 1/3
P.M. that it is true. Weyl (1949) seems to have been the first to
point to this intriguing method -the use of supertaks- for settling
mathematical questions about natural numbers. He, however, rejected
it on the basis of his finitist conception of mathematics; since the
performance of a supertask involves the successive carrying out of an
actual infinity of actions or operations, and the infinity is
impossible to accomplish, in his view. For Weyl, taking the infinite
as an actual entity makes no sense. Nevertheless, there are more
problems here than Weyl imagines, at least for those who ground their
finitist philosophy of mathematics on intuitionism à la
Brouwer. That is because Brouwer's rejection of actual infinity stems
from the fact that we, as beings, are immersed in time. But this in
itself does not mean that all infinities are impossible to accomplish,
since an infinity machine is also ‘a being immerse in
time’ and that in itself does not prevent the carrying out of
the infinity of successive actions a supertask is comprised of. It
goes without saying that one can adhere to a constructivist philosophy
of mathematics (and the consequent rejection of actual infinity) for
diferent reasons from Brouwer's; supertasks will still not be the
right kind of objet to study either.
As Benacerraf and Putnam (1964) have observed, the acknowledgement
that supertasks are possible has a profound influence on the
philosophy of mathematics: the notion of truth (in arithmetic, say)
would no longer be doubtful, in the sense of dependent on the
particular axiomatisation used. The example mentioned earlier in
connection with Goldbach's conjecture can indeed be reproduced and
generalised to all other mathematical statements involving numbers
(although, depending on the complexity of the statement, we might need
to use several infinity machines instead of just one), and so,
consequently, supertasks will enable us to decide on the truth or
falsity of any arithmetical statement; our conclusion will no longer
depend on provability in some formal system or constructibility in a
more or less strict intuitionistic sense. This conclusion seems to
lead to a Platonist philosophy of mathematics.
A similar conclusion follows regarding the implications of supertasks
for the philosophy of mathematics if one only accepts the possibility
of bifurcated supertasks. Of course, a bifurcated supertask performed
in a non-Malament-Hogarth space-time would not be so interesting in
this sense. The obvious reason is that we would not even have a sound
procedure to determine the truth or falsity of Goldbach's conjecture
seen in 5.1 by means of the performance of an infinite sequence of
actions of order type w. To really have a safe decision procedure in
this simple case (as in other, more complex ones) there must
necessarily exist an instant of time at which it can be said that the
supertask has been accomplished. Otherwise, in the event that the
machine finds a counterexample to Goldbach's conjecture we will know
it to be false, but in the event of the machine finding none we will
not be able to tell that it is true, because for this there must exist
an instant of time by which the supertask has been accomplished and at
which we can say something like: "the supertask has been performed and
the machine has found no counterexamples to Goldbach's conjecture;
therefore, the conjecture is true". It follows that, in the case of a
bifurcated supertask, possessing a sound decision procedure on
Goldbach's conjecture requires the existence of an observer O such
that the infinite sequence of actions (of order type w) carried out by
the machine lies within the past light cone of an event on observer
O's world-line. But this is equivalent to saying that the
relativistic space-time in which the bifurcated supertask is performed
is a Malament-Hogarth space-time, and this realisation is one of the
main reasons why this sort of relativistic space-times have been
studied in the literature.
Note, finally, the intuitionistic criticism of the possibility of
supertasks is even less effective in the case of bifurcated
supertasks, because in this latter case it is not required that there
is any sort of device capable of carrying out an infinite number of
actions or operations in a finite time (measured in the reference
system associated to the device in question, which is the natural
reference system to consider). In contrast, from the possibility of
bifurcated supertasks in Malament-Hogarth space-times strong arguments
follow against an intuitionistic philosophy of mathematics. As Earman
and Norton remind us, it is noteworthy that certain facts relative to
the non-Euclidean structure of space-time can have relevant
consequences for the nature of mathematical truth.
- Allis, V. and Koetsier, T., 1991, ‘On Some Paradoxes of the
Infinite’, British Journal for the Philosophy of Science,
42, pp. 187-194
- Allis, V. and Koetsier, T., 1995, ‘On Some Paradoxes of the
Infinite II’, British Journal for the Philosophy of
Science, 46, pp. 235-247
- Alper, J.S. and Bridger, M., 1998, ‘Newtonian Supertasks: A
Critical Analysis’ Synthese, 114, pp. 355-369
- Alper, J.S., Bridger, M., Earman , J. and Norton , J.D., 2000,
‘What is a Newtonian System? The Failure of Energy Conservation
and Determinism in Supertasks’ Synthese, 124,
pp.281-293
- Aristotle, Physics, (W. Charlton, trans.), Oxford: Oxford
University Press, 1970
- Benacerraf, P., 1962, ‘Tasks, Super-Tasks, and Modern
Eleatics’, Journal of Philosophy, LIX,
pp. 765-784; reprinted in Salmon [1970]
- Benacerraf, P. and Putnam, H., 1964, Introduction, Philosophy
of Mathematics: Selected Readings, P. Benacerraf and H. Putnam
(eds.), 2nd edition, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, pp. 1-27
- Benardete, J.A., 1964, Infinity: An Essay in Metaphysics,
Oxford: Clarendon Press
- Berresford, G. C., 1981, ‘A Note on Thomson's Lamp
"Paradox"’, Analysis, 41, pp. 1-7
- Black, M., 1950-1, ‘Achilles and the Tortoise’,
Analysis, XI, pp. 91-101; reprinted in Salmon [1970]
- Black, M., 1954, Problems of Analysis, Ithaca: Cornell
University Press
- Bostock, D., 1972-73, ‘Aristotle, Zeno and the Potential
Infinite’, Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society,
73, pp. 37-51
- Burke, M.B., 1984, ‘The Infinitistic Thesis’, The
Southern Journal of Philosophy, 22, pp. 295-305
- Burke, M.B., 2000, ‘The Impossibility of Superfeats’,
The Southern Journal of Philosophy, XXXVIII, pp.207-220
- Burke, M.B., 2000, ‘The Staccato Run: a Contemporary Issue
in the Zenonian Tradition’ ,The Modern Schoolman,
LXXVIII, pp.1-8
- Bridger, M., and Alper, J. S., 1999, ‘On the Dynamics of
Perez-Laraudogoitia's Supertask’, Synthese,
119, pp. 325-337
- Chihara, C., 1965, ‘On the Possibility of Completing an
Infinite Task’, Philosophical Review, LXXIV,
pp. 74-87
- Clark, P., and Read, S., 1984, ‘Hypertasks’,
Synthese, 61, pp. 387-390
- Earman, J., 1994, Bangs, Crunches, Shrieks, and Whimpers:
Singularities and Acausalities in Relativistic Spacetimes, New
York: Oxford University Press
- Earman, J., and Norton, J.D., 1993, ‘Forever Is a Day:
Supertasks in Pitowsky and Malament-Hogarth Spacetimes’,
Philosophy of Science, 60, pp. 22-42
- Earman, J., and Norton, J. D., 1996, ‘Infinite Pains: The
Trouble with Supertasks’, in Benacerraf and His Critics,
A. Morton and S. Stich (eds.), Oxford: Blackwell, pp. 231-261.
- Earman, J., and Norton, J. D., 1998, ‘Comments on
Laraudogoitia's "Classical Particle Dynamics, Indeterminism and
a Supertask"’, British Journal for the Philosophy of
Science, 49, pp. 123-133
- Faris, J. A., 1996, The Paradoxes of Zeno, Aldershot:
Avebury
- Gale, R. M. (ed.), 1968, The Philosophy of Time, London:
MacMillan
- Glazebrook, T., 2001, ‘Zeno Against Mathematical
Physics’, Journal of the History of Ideas, 62,
pp.193-210
- Groarke, L., 1982, ‘Zeno's Dichotomy: Undermining the
Modern Response’, Auslegung, 9, pp. 67-75
- Grünbaum, A. 1950-52 ‘Messrs. Black and Taylor on
Temporal Paradoxes’, Analysis, 11-12, pp. 144-148
- Grünbaum, A., 1967, Modern Science and Zeno's
Paradoxes, Middletown, CT: Wesleyan University Press
- Grünbaum, A., 1968, ‘Are "Infinity Machines"
Paradoxical?’, Science, CLIX, pp. 396-406
- Grünbaum, A., 1969, ‘Can an Infinitude of Operations be
Performed in a Finite Time?’, British Journal for the
Philosophy of Science, 20, pp. 203-218
- Grünbaum, A., 1970, ‘Modern Science and Zeno's
Paradoxes of Motion’, in Salmon [1970], pp. 200-250
- Hogarth, M. L., 1992, ‘Does General Relativity Allow an
Observer to View an Eternity in a Finite Time?’, Foundations
of Physics Letters, 5, pp. 173-181
- Hogarth, M. L., 1994, ‘Non-Turing Computers and Non-Turing
Computability’, in PSA 1994, D. Hull, M. Forbes and
R.M. Burian (eds.), 1, East Lansing: Philosophy of Science
Association, pp. 126-138
- Holgate, P., 1994, ‘Discussion: Mathematical Notes on
Ross's Paradox’, British Journal for the Philosophy of
Science, 45, pp. 302-304
- Koetsier, T. and Allis, V., 1997, ‘Assaying
Supertasks’, Logique & Analyse, 159, pp. 291-313
- McLaughlin, W. I., 1998, ‘Thomson's Lamp is
Dysfunctional’, Synthese, 116, pp. 281-301
- Moore, A. W., 1989-90, ‘A Problem for Intuitionism: The
Apparent Possibility of Performing Infinitely Many Tasks in a Finite
Time’, Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society,
90, pp. 17-34
- Moore, A. W., 1990, The Infinite, London: Routledge
- Norton, J. D., 1999, ‘A Quantum Mechanical Supertask’,
Foundations of Physics, 29, pp. 1265-1302
- Owen, G. E. L., 1957-58, ‘Zeno and the Mathematicians’,
Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, LVIII,
pp. 199-222, reprinted in Salmon [1970]
- Pérez Laraudogoitia, J., 1996, ‘A Beautiful
Supertask’, Mind, 105, pp. 81-83
- Pérez Laraudogoitia, J., 1997, ‘Classical Particle
Dynamics, Indeterminism and a Supertask’, British Journal for
the Philosophy of Science, 48, pp. 49-54
- Pérez Laraudogoitia, J., 1998, ‘Infinity Machines and
Creation Ex Nihilo’, Synthese, 115,
pp. 259-265
- Pérez Laraudogoitia, J., 1998, ‘Some Relativistic and
Higher Order Supertasks’, Philosophy of Science,
65, pp. 502-517
- Pérez Laraudogoitia, J., 1999, ‘Earman and Norton on
Supertasks that Generate Indeterminism’, British Journal for
the Philosphy of Science, 50, pp.137-141
- Pérez Laraudogoitia, J., 1999, ‘Why Dynamical
Self-excitation is Possible’, Synthese, 119,
pp. 313-323
- Pitowsky, I., 1990, ‘The Physical Church Thesis and Physical
Computational Complexity’, Iyyun, 39, pp. 81-99
- Priest, G., 1982, ‘To Be and Not to Be: Dialectical Tense
Logic’, Studia Logica, XLI, pp. 157-176
- Ray, C., 1990, ‘Paradoxical Tasks’, Analysis,
50, pp. 71-74
- Ray, C., 1991, Time, Space and Philosophy, London:
Routledge
- Sainsbury, R. M., 1988, Paradoxes, Cambridge: Cambridge
University Press
- Salmon, W., (ed.), 1970, Zeno's Paradoxes,
Indianapolis: Bobbs-Merril
- Salmon, W., 1980, Space, Time and Motion: A Philosophical
Introduction, Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press
- Smith, J. W., 1986, Reason, Science and Paradox, London:
Croom Helm
- Sorabji, R., 1983, Time, Creation and the Continuum,
London: Gerald Duckworth and Co. Ltd.
- Svozil, K., 1993, Randomness and Undecidability in
Physics, Singapore: World Scientific
- Taylor, R., 1951-52, ‘Mr. Black on Temporal Paradoxes’,
Analysis, XII, pp. 38-44
- Taylor, R., 1952-53, ‘Mr. Wisdom on Temporal
Paradoxes’, Analysis, XIII, pp. 15-17
- Thomson, J., 1954-55, ‘Tasks and Super-Tasks’,
Analysis, XV, pp. 1-13; reprinted in Salmon [1970]
- Thomson, J., 1967, ‘Infinity in Mathematics and Logic’,
in Encyclopedia of Philosophy, P. Edwards (ed.), 4, New
York: MacMillan, pp. 183-90
- Thomson, J., 1970, ‘Comments on Professor Benacerraf's
Paper’, in Salmon [1970], pp. 130-38.
- Van Bendegem, J. P., 1994, ‘Ross' Paradox is an
Impossible Super Task’, British Journal for the Philosophy of
Science, 45, pp. 743-48
- Van Bendegem, J. P., 1995-1997, ‘In Defence of Discrete
Space and Time’, Logique & Analyse, 150-151-152,
pp. 127-150
- Vlastos, G., 1966, ‘Zeno's Race Course’,
Journal of the History of Philosophy, IV, pp. 95-108
- Vlastos, G., 1967, ‘Zeno of Elea’, in Encyclopedia
of Philosophy, P. Edwards (ed.), 8, New York: MacMillan,
pp.369-79
- Watling, J., 1953, ‘The Sum of an Infinite Series’,
Analysis, XIII, pp. 39-46
- Wedeking, G. A., 1968, ‘On a Finitist "Solution" to Some
Zenonian Paradoxes’, Mind, 77, pp. 420-26
- Weyl, H., 1949, Philosophy of Mathematics and Natural
Science, Princeton: Princeton University Press
- Whitrow, G. J., 1961, The Natural Philosophy of Time,
Edinburgh: Thomas Nelson & Sons
- Wisdom, J. O., 1951-52, ‘Achilles on a Physical
Racecourse’, Analysis, XII, pp. 67-72, reprinted
in Salmon [1970]
[Please contact the author with suggestions.]
infinity |
space and time: Malament-Hogarth spacetimes and the new computability |
Zeno's paradoxes
A |
B |
C |
D |
E |
F |
G |
H |
I |
J |
K |
L |
M |
N |
O |
P |
Q |
R |
S |
T |
U |
V |
W |
X |
Y |
Z
Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy