Notes to Computer Ethics: Basic Concepts and Historical Overview
1. It will evolve, she said, into a system of global ethics applicable in every culture on earth. In Gorniak-Kocikowska [1996], we find:Just as the major ethical theories of Bentham and Kant were developed in response to the printing press revolution, so a new ethical theory is likely to emerge from computer ethics in response to the computer revolution. The newly emerging field of information ethics, therefore, is much more important than even its founders and advocates believe. (p. 177)... The very nature of the Computer Revolution indicates that the ethic of the future will have a global character. It will be global in a spatial sense, since it will encompass the entire Globe. It will also be global in the sense that it will address the totality of human actions and relations. (p. 179)
... the rules of computer ethics, no matter how well thought through, will be ineffective unless respected by the vast majority of or maybe even all computer users. This means that in the future, the rules of computer ethics should be respected by the majority (or all) of the human inhabitants of the Earth ... . In other words, computer ethics will become universal, it will be a global ethic. (p. 187)
2. In Johnson [1999], we find:
I offer you a picture of computer ethics in which computer ethics as such disappears. ... We will be able to say both that computer ethics has become ordinary ethics and that ordinary ethics has become computer ethics. (pp. 17-18)