Notes to Feminist Bioethics

1. Many bioethics texts include a section on the historical origins of bioethics, particularly the abuses that led to its initial formation. See, for instance, Teays and Purdy (2001). The British Medical Association Handbook (2001) includes more extended discussion of medical abuses.

2. Alison Jaggar's encyclopedia article,“Feminist Ethics,” provides an excellent summary of many of the key features of second wave feminism that have influenced feminist bioethics (2001).

3. For a more comprehensive review of this history and references to the extensive literature on the women's health movement, see Dresser (1996).

4. Best known for its national best-selling paperback, Our Bodies, Ourselves: A Book By and for Women (originally published in 1970 and now in its seventh edition).

5. Exceptions include Teays & Purdy 2001; Fulford, Dickenson & Murray 2002; and Nelson & Nelson 1999.

6. The literature on this topic is voluminous. A good place to get an initial grasp of interconnections between different standard interpretations of autonomy and the informed consent process is the article “Four Models of the Physician-Patient Relationship” (Emanuel & Emanuel 1992).

7. Mackenzie and Stoljar include in their anthology a comprehensive introduction that sorts out feminist critiques of autonomy and constructive reformulations in more detail (2000).