Notes to Internalist vs. Externalist Conceptions of Epistemic Justification

1. Conee and Feldman accept a version of internalism, namely mentalism, but eschew deontological concepts of epistemic justification. See “Internalism Defended,” op. cit., pp. 239-240.

2. William Alston suggests that the activity of justifying a belief is somehow fundamental to a belief's being justified, though he stops short of endorsing the thesis that one is justified in believing p only if one actually has justified this belief. See Epistemic Justification, op. cit., p. 236.

3. Goldman also notes the difference between the GD concept and the deontological concept of justification framed in terms of duties and responsibilities. See his “Internalism Exposed,” in Kornblith, op. cit., p. 209. This paper was first published in the Journal of Philosophy,96, (1999). References here are to the paper in the Kornblith volume.

4. This is here called “Goldman's argument,” though it is hardly one that he would defend. This term is used simply to indicate that he has presented this argument in a clear form.

5. Conee and Feldman suggest that the argument Goldman presents is really an argument constructed by critics of internalism rather than one any defender of internalism has actually presented. See their “Internalism Defended,” op. cit., note 20, p. 257.