Supplement to Deontic Logic
SDL Containment Proof
Recall SDL:
A1: All tautologous wffs of the language (TAUT) A2: OB(p → q) → (OBp → OBq) (OB-K) A3: OBp → ~OB~p (OB-NC) R1: If p and p → q then q (MP) R2: If p then OBp (OB-NEC)
We have already shown OB-NC is derivable in Kd above, and TAUT and MP are given, since they hold for all formulas of Kd. So we need only derive OB-K and OB-NEC of SDL, which we will do in reverse order. Note that RM, if r → s, then □r → □s), is derivable in Kd, and so we rely on it in the second proof.[1]
Show: If p then OBp. (OB-NEC)
Proof: Assume p. It follows by PC that d → p. So by NEC for □, we get □(d → p), that is, OBp.
Show: OB(p → q) → (OBp → OBq). (K of SDL)
Proof: Assume OB(p → q) and OBp. From PC alone, (d → (p → q)) → [(d → p) → (d → q)]. So by RM for □, we have □(d → (p → q)) → □[(d → p) → (d → q)]. But the antecedent of this is just, OB(p → q) in disguise, which is our first assumption. So we have □[(d → p) → (d → q)] by MP. Applying K for □ to this, we get □(d → p) → □(d → q). But the antecedent to this is just our second assumption, OBp. So by MP, we get □(d → q), that is, OBq.
Metatheorem: SDL is derivable in Kd.
Note that showing that the pure deontic fragment of Kd contains no more than SDL is a more complex matter. The proof relies on already having semantic metatheorems available. An excellent source for this is Åqvist 2002 [1984].[2]
Return to Deontic Logic.