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Inconsistent Mathematics

First published Tue Jul 2, 1996; substantive revision Tue Aug 3, 2004

Inconsistent mathematics is the study of the mathematical theories that result when classical mathematical axioms are asserted within the framework of a (non-classical) logic which can tolerate the presence of a contradiction without turning every sentence into a theorem.

1. Inconsistent Mathematics

Inconsistent Mathematics began historically with foundational considerations. Set-theoretic paradoxes such as Russell's led to attempts to produce a consistent set theory as a foundation for mathematics. But, as is well known, set theories such as ZF, NBG and the like were in various ways ad hoc. Hence, a number of people including da Costa (1974), Brady (1971), Priest, Routley, and Norman (1989), considered it preferable to retain the full power of the natural abstraction principle (every predicate determines a set), and tolerate a degree of inconsistency in set theory. This requires, of course, that one dispense with the logical principle ex contradictione quodlibet (ECQ) (from a contradiction every proposition may be deduced), as well as any principle which leads to it, such as disjunctive syllogism (DS) (from A-or-B and not-A deduce B). But considerable debate, in Burgess (1981) and Mortensen (1983), made it clear that dispensing with ECQ and DS was not so counter-intuitive, especially when a plausible story emerged about the special conditions under which they continue to hold.

In addition, mathematics has a metalanguage; that is, names for mathematical statements and other parts of syntax, self-reference, proof and truth. Gödel's contribution to the philosophy of mathematics was to show that the first three of these can be rigorously expressed in arithmetical theories, albeit in theories which are either inconsistent or incomplete. The possibility of a well-structured example of the former alternative was not taken seriously, again because of belief in ECQ. However, in addition natural languages seem to have their own truth predicate. Combined with self-reference this produces the Liar paradox, "This sentence is false", an inconsistency. Priest (1987) and Priest, Routley, and Norman (1989) argued that the Liar had to be regarded as a statement both true and false, a true contradiction. This represents another argument for studying inconsistent theories, namely the claim that some contradictions are true. Kripke (1975) proposed instead to model a truth predicate differently, in a consistent incomplete theory. We see below that incompleteness and inconsistency are closely related.

But mathematics is not its foundations. Hence there is a further independent motive, to see what mathematical structure remains when the constraint of consistency is relaxed. But it would be wrong to regard this as in any way a loss of structure. If it is different at all, then it represents an addition to known structure.

Robert K. Meyer (1976) seems to have been the first to think of an inconsistent arithmetical theory. At this point, he was more interested in the fate of a consistent theory, his relevant arithmetic R#. There proved to be a whole class of inconsistent arithmetical theories; see Meyer and Mortensen (1984), for example. Meyer argued that these theories provide the basis for a revived Hilbert Program. Hilbert's program was widely held to have been seriously damaged by Gödel's Second Incompleteness Theorem, according to which the consistency of arithmetic was unprovable within arithmetic itself. But a consequence of Meyer's construction was that within his arithmetic R# it was demonstrable by simple finitary means that whatever contradictions there might happen to be, they could not adversely affect any numerical calculations. Hence Hilbert's goal of conclusively demonstrating that mathematics is trouble-free proves largely achievable. The arithmetical models used later proved to allow inconsistent representation of the truth predicate. They also permit representation of structures beyond natural number arithmetic, such as rings and fields, including their order properties. Recently, these inconsistent arithmetical models have been completely characterised by Graham Priest; that is, Priest showed that all such models take a certain general form. See Priest (1997), (2000).

One could hardly ignore the examples of analysis and its special case, the calculus. There prove to be many places where there are distinctive inconsistent insights; see Mortensen (1995) for example. (1) Robinson's non-standard analysis was based on infinitesimals, quantities smaller than any real number, as well as their reciprocals, the infinite numbers. This has an inconsistent version, which has some advantages for calculation in being able to discard higher-order infinitesimals. Interestingly, the theory of differentiation turned out to have these advantages, while the theory of integration did not. (2) Another place is topology, where one readily observes the practice of cutting and pasting spaces being described as "identification" of one boundary with another. One can show that this can be described in an inconsistent theory in which the two boundaries are both identical and not identical, and it can be further argued that this is the most natural description of the practice. (3) Yet another application is the class of inconsistent continuous functions. Not all functions which are classically discontinuous are amenable of inconsistent treatment; but some are, for example f(x)=0 for all x<0 and f(x)=1 for all x≥0. The inconsistent extension replaces the first < by ≤, and has distinctive structural properties. These inconsistent functions may well have some application in dynamic systems in which there are discontinuous jumps, such as quantum measurement systems. Differentiating such functions leads to the delta functions, applied by Dirac to the study of quantum measurement also. (4) Next, there is the well-known case of inconsistent systems of linear equations, such as the system (i) x+y=1, plus (ii) x+y=2. Such systems can potentially arise within the context of automated control. Little work has been done classically to solve such systems, but it can be shown that there are well-behaved solutions within inconsistent vector spaces. (5) Finally, one can note a further application in topology and dynamics. Given a supposition which seems to be conceivable, namely that whatever happens or is true, happens or is true on an open set of (spacetime) points, one has that the logic of dynamically possible paths is open set logic, that is to say intuitionist logic, which supports incomplete theories par excellence. This is because the natural account of the negation of a proposition in such a space says that it holds on the largest open set contained in the Boolean complement of the set of points on which the original proposition held, which is in general smaller than the Boolean complement. However, specifying a topological space by its closed sets is every bit as reasonable as specifying it by its open sets. Yet the logic of closed sets is known to be paraconsistent, ie. supports inconsistent theories; see Goodman (1981) for example. Thus given the (alternative) supposition which also seems to be conceivable, namely that whatever is true is true on a closed set of points, one has that inconsistent theories may well hold. This is because the natural account of the negation of a proposition, namely that it holds on the smallest closed set containing the Boolean negation of the proposition, means that on the overlapping boundary both the proposition and its negation hold. Thus dynamical theories determine their own logic of possible propositions, and corresponding theories which may be inconsistent, and are certainly as natural as their incomplete counterparts.

Category theory throws light on many mathematical structures. It has certainly been proposed as an alternative foundation for mathematics. Such generality inevitably runs into problems similar to those of comprehension in set theory, see eg. Hatcher (1982, p.255-260). Hence there is the same possible application of inconsistent solutions. There is also an important collection of categorial structures, the toposes, which support open set logic in exact parallel to the way sets support Boolean logic. This has been taken by many to be a vindication of the foundational point of view of mathematical intuitionism. However, it can be proved that that toposes support closed set logic as readily as they support open set logic. That should not be viewed as an objection to intuitionism, however, so much as an argument that inconsistent theories are equally reasonable as items of mathematical study.

Duality between incompleteness/intuitionism and inconsistency/paraconsistency has at least two aspects. First there is the above topological (open/closed) duality. Second there is Routley * duality. Discovered by the Routleys (1972) as a semantical tool for relevant logics, the * operation dualises between inconsistent and incomplete theories of the large natural class of de Morgan logics. Both kinds of duality interact as well, where the * gives distinctive duality and invariance theorems for open set and closed set arithmetical theories. On the basis of these results, it is fair to argue that both kinds of mathematics, intuitionist and paraconsistent, are equally reasonable.

A very recent development is the application to explaining the phenomenon of inconsistent pictures. The best known of these are perhaps M.C.Escher's masterpieces Belvedere, Waterfall and Ascending and Descending. In fact the tradition goes back millennia to Pompeii. Escher seems to have derived many of his intuitions from the Swedish artist Oscar Reutersvaard, who began in 1934. Escher also actively collaborated with the English mathematician Roger Penrose. There have been several attempts to describe the mathematical structure of inconsistent pictures using classical consistent mathematics, by theorists such as Cowan, Francis and Penrose. As argued in Mortensen (1997), however, no consistent mathematical theory can capture the sense that one is seeing an impossible thing. Only an inconsistent theory can capture the content of that perception. This amounts to an appeal to cognition, that is the epistemological justification of paraconsistency as above. One can then proceed to describe inconsistent theories which are candidates for such inconsistent contents. There is an analogy with classical mathematics on this point. Projective geometry is a mathematical theory which is interesting because we are creatures with an eye, since it explains why it is that things look the way they do in perspective. This study has been further developed in Mortensen (2002a), where category theory is applied to give a general description of the relationships between the various theories and their consistent cut-downs and incomplete duals. For an informal account which highlights the difference between visual "paradoxes" and the philosophically more common paradoxes of language, such as the Liar, see Mortensen (2002b).

It should be emphasised that these constructions do not in any way challenge or repudiate existing mathematics, but extend our conception of what is mathematically possible.

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contradiction | logic: paraconsistent | mathematics, philosophy of