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Monism

First published Mon 19 Mar, 2007

There are many monisms. What they have in common is that they attribute oneness. Where they differ is in what they target and how they count.

This entry focuses on two of the more historically important monisms: existence monism and priority monism. Existence monism targets concrete objects and counts by tokens. This is the doctrine that exactly one concrete object exists. Priority monism also targets concrete objects, but counts by basic tokens. This is the doctrine that exactly one concrete object is basic, which will turn out to be the classical doctrine that the whole is prior to its parts.

Neither existence nor priority monism is accorded much respect in contemporary metaphysics, nor are they always properly distinguished. Indeed, the entire monistic tradition is often dismissed as being somewhere between obscure and ridiculous. But there are serious arguments for monism. In particular, priority monism may be especially worthy of serious reconsideration.

1. Monisms

There are many monisms. What they have in common is that they attribute oneness. Where they differ is in what they attribute oneness to (the target), and how they count (the unit). Thus, strictly speaking, there is only monism relative to a target and unit, where monism for target t counted by unit u is the view that t counted by u is one.

Monisms contrast with pluralisms and nihilisms. Where the monist for target t counted by unit u holds that t counted by u is one, her pluralistic counterpart holds that t counted by u is many, and her nihilistic counterpart holds that t counted by u is none. (Dualism is a special case of pluralism: the dualist holds that t counted by u is two.)[1]

To illustrate, let the target t1 = the category of concrete object, and let the unit u1 = highest type. To be a monist for t1 counted by u1 is to hold that concrete objects fall under one highest type. The materialist, idealist, and neutral monist are all monists of this sort (substance monism). They all agree that concrete objects fall under one highest type, disagreeing only over whether the one highest type is material, mental, or something deeper.

To be a pluralist for t1 counted by u1 is to hold that concrete objects fall under more than one highest type. The Cartesian dualist is a pluralist of this sort (substance dualism). She holds that concrete objects fall under two highest types, specifically the material (with the primary attribute of extension) and the mental (with the primary attribute of thought).

To be a nihilist for t1 counted by u1 is to hold that concrete objects fall under no highest type. The bundle theorist who is an eliminativist about concrete objects would be a nihilist of this sort (substance nihilism). This sort of bundle theorist denies that there are any concrete objects, maintaining that there are just bundles of compresent properties.[2]

As a second illustration, let t2 = the category of properties. The substance monist (the monist for t1 counted by u1, e.g., the materialist) might be a pluralist for t2 counted by u1. (This illustrates the need for relativization to targets.) That is, she might hold that there are two highest types of property, physical and mental, inhering in one and the same type of substance (property dualism). Or the substance monist might be a nihilist for t2 counted by u1, by being an eliminative nominalist about properties.

As a third illustration, let u2 = individual token. The substance monist might be a pluralist for t1 counted by u2. (This illustrates the need for relativization to units.) She might hold that there exist many concrete object tokens (existence pluralism), while maintaining, for instance, that these are all material objects. Likewise the substance pluralist for t1 counted by u1 might be a monist for t1 counted by u2. This would be to hold the view that there is one concrete object token, with multiple highest types of properties. For instance, one might hold that there is only ‘the world-person’ with two highest types of property, physical and mental.

These illustrations show that monism must be relativized to both a target and a unit. The underlying explanation for why such double relativity is needed is that the monistic thesis involves numerical predication (‘…is one’), and all numerical predication is doubly relative in this way: for a target (that which is counted), and by a unit (what counts as one). This is the moral of Frege's insight that: “While looking at one and the same external phenomenon, I can say with equal truth both ‘It is a copse’ and ‘It is five trees’ ”, or both ‘Here are four companies’ and ‘Here are 500 men’ ” (1884: 59). Here the ‘external phenomenon’ is the target, and ‘copse’ and ‘tree’ (or ‘companies’ and ‘men’) are units.[3]

In what remains of this section, I will say more about the many monisms. Here I will mention some of the more interesting target and units, leading to a taxonomy of monisms.

There are three main sorts of interesting targets for monism. First, on the most general level, monism may target the categories themselves. This would be to maintain that the types of entities have some sort of unity. For instance, there might be one highest genus they all fall under. Second, at an intermediate level, monism may target a particular category of entities. This would be to maintain that some particular type of entity (e.g., concrete objects, in the examples above and the sections below) has some sort of unity. Third, at the most specific level, monism may target a particular entity. This would be to maintain that some particular token (e.g., this chair) has some sort of unity. For instance, it might be functionally integrated like a watch.

Different count policies are appropriate for different targets. Starting at the level of the categories, perhaps the two most natural count policies are: (i) number of categories (including subcategories), and (ii) number of highest categories (thus excluding subcategories). The philosopher who holds that there is a highest genus with many species would be a monist about the number of highest categories (genus monism) but a pluralist about the number of categories.[4] Aristotle, in contrast, is a pluralist about both the number of categories and the number of highest categories, since he denies the existence of a unique highest type.[5]

At the level of particular categories, suppose we allow concrete object as one such category. Here there are at least four natural count policies: (i) the number of types (including subtypes), (ii) the number of highest types (excluding subtypes), (iii) the number of tokens (including derivative tokens), and (iv) the number of basic tokens (excluding derivative tokens). The neutral monist (as per above) is a pluralist about the number of types, but a monist about the number of highest types. On her view there are material and mental types, but both fall under a higher neutral type from which the material and the mental are derivative. The priority monist (as per above) is a pluralist about the number of tokens but a monist about the number of basic tokens. On her view there are many concrete objects, but they are all derivative fragments of the one basic whole. They are shards of the One.

Suppose we allow abstract object as another such category. Here there does not seem to be a natural type/token distinction.[6] So here there seem to be two main natural count policies: (i) the number of abstract objects (including derivative ones), and (ii) the number of basic abstract objects. So consider the hierarchy of pure set theoretic objects, and suppose these comprise a single category (the pure set-theoretic abstracta). Here one might be a pluralist about the number of pure set-theoretic abstracta that exist, but a monist about the number of basic set-theoretic abstracta, insofar as one holds that the entire hierarchy is founded upon the empty set.

In general, it seems that for any category that supports a type/token distinction—perhaps for any concrete category—there will be the four natural count policies as seen with concrete objects. While for any category that does not support a type/token distinction—perhaps for any abstract category—it seems that there will only be the two natural count policies as seen with abstract objects. Thus with concrete events, one might count by types, highest types, tokens, or basic tokens. While with abstract Platonic universals, one might count the number of forms, or the number of basic forms. Plato is a pluralist about the number of forms, but a monist about the number of basic forms, maintaining that they are all sustained by the form of the good.[7]

Finally, at the level of a particular entity, there are a dizzying variety of natural count policies. A particular concrete object might, for instance, be counted by (i) the number of its parts, (ii) the number of its atomic parts, (iii) the number of its maximally continuous parts, (iv) the number of its functionally integrated parts, or (v) the number of its qualitatively homogeneous parts. So if one considers a chess set, one might count it functionally as 1 (1 chess set), by its connected parts as 33 (32 pieces and 1 board), by its homogeneous parts as 96 (32 pieces plus 64 squares), by its atomic parts as bazillions of particles, and by its parts as 2n−1, where n is the number of its atomic parts.[8] Obviously many other count policies are available. It is not clear that there is more to be said of a systematic nature about natural count policies for various particular entities.[9]

Putting this together, here is a table of some of the more natural monisms (excluding those that target particular entities, and lumping together the various categories of concrete and abstract entities):

Units
Highest Types Tokens Basic Tokens
Targets Categories Genus monism X X
Concreta Substance monism Existence monism Priority monism
Abstracta Property monism X X

The labeled boxes represent the locations of some natural monisms. The four ‘X’-ed boxes represent locations where the question of monism does not arise, given that the notion of a token only makes sense for concreta.[10]

Most of these views are independent, though there are the following logical relations. Pluralism about the number of basic tokens for some concrete category entails pluralism about the respective number of tokens. In the other direction, both monism and nihilism about the number of tokens for some concrete category entails a corresponding monism or nihilism about the respective number of basic tokens. Further, nihilism about the number of highest types for any concrete category entails nihilism about the number of tokens (and thus the number of basic tokens) for that category.

Thus with existence monism and priority monism (the main focus of what follows), one finds the following logical relations: existence monism entails priority monism, and priority pluralism entails existence pluralism. But otherwise the views are independent. So for instance, one might be an existence pluralist but a priority monist. This would be to maintain that many things exist (not just the world, but also persons, furniture, particles, and whatnot), but that the whole world is basic. The partialia are merely dependent fragments. I will suggest that this is the view that most historical monists have held, and the view which is especially deserving of reconsideration.[11]

2. Existence Monism

Existence monism targets the category concrete object and counts by token. It holds that exactly one concrete object token exists (the One).

Historically, existence monism may have been defended by Parmenides, Melissus, and Spinoza.[12] Among contemporary philosophers, Horgan and Potrč are probably the leading, and perhaps the only, existence monists.[13] Thus Horgan and Potrč advance the following ontological and semantical theses:

  1. There really is just one concrete particular, viz., the whole universe (the blobject).
  2. The blobject has enormous spatiotemporal structural complexity, and enormous local variability—even though it does not have any genuine parts.
  3. Numerous statements employing posits of common sense and science are true, even though nothing in the world answers directly to these posits.
  4. Truth, for such statements, is indirect language-world correspondence. (2000: 249)

Note that existence monism should not be confused with the formula: ∃x∀y(y=x). That is the logician's formula for expressing the claim that exactly one entity exists. The existence monist is making a much weaker (and perhaps slightly more plausible) claim. She can allow that many abstract entities exist, she can allow that many spatiotemporal points exist (assuming that she does not follow the supersubstantivalist in identifying objects with regions), and she can allow that many property tokens exist (assuming she does not follow the bundle theorist in identifying objects with compresent property tokens), as long as she maintains that only one concrete object token exists.[14] If one feels the need to find a logical formula to associate with existence monism, one will first need to introduce a predicate ‘C’ that denotes the property of being a concrete object. Then one can introduce the formula:

Existence monism: ∃x(Cx & ∀y(Cy → y=x))

The corresponding logical formulae for existence pluralism and nihilism then run:

Existence pluralism: ∃x∃y(Cx & Cy & x≠y)

Existence nihilism: ~∃xCx

So much for formulations. The notion of being a concrete object is natural and useful, so this should be clear enough to work with. I now turn to surveying arguments.

To my knowledge there is one main argument for existence monism, which is that it provides the simplest sufficient ontology.[15] The idea is that we can give a complete account of the phenomena in which the world is the only concrete object mentioned, so that there is need to posit any further concreta. The argument may be formulated as follows:

  1. The world is the only concrete object needed to explain how the world evolves.

Somewhat more precisely, 1 claims that the complete causal story of the world can be told in terms of the physical aspect of the world (a path in physical configuration space), together with whatever laws of nature govern temporal evolution. No pieces of the world (such as tables or particles) need be mentioned in this story. To take a toy example, consider a Newtonian world containing what the folk would describe as a rock shattering a window. The complete causal story here can be told purely in terms of the world's occupational manner vis-à-vis Newtonian configuration space.[16] The rock and the window need not be mentioned. The world bears all the causal information.

The argument then adds that recognizing proper parts of the world is recognizing what is either explanatorily redundant or epiphenomenal:

  1. If the world is the only concrete object needed to explain how the world evolves, then if there were proper parts of the world, these proper parts would be explanatorily redundant or epiphenomenal entities.

If the world suffices to explain everything, then there is nothing left for its proper parts to explain. Its proper parts can at best explain what the world already suffices for. So if the proper parts explain anything at all they are redundant, while if they explain nothing at all they are epiphenomenal.

The argument continues with a rejection of both explanatorily redundant and epiphenomenal entities:

  1. There are no explanatorily redundant or epiphenomenal entities.

Such a rejection is best defended on methodological grounds. Occam's Razor cuts against both explanatorily redundant and epiphenomenal entities, as there can be no need for positing either.[17] From which the argument concludes:

  1. The world has no proper parts.[18]   

The conclusion may seem shocking, but the argument is valid, and the premises seem plausible.[19]

How might the existence pluralist and nihilist reply? Starting with the existence pluralist, she might try to deny 1, by denying that the world exists. This might seem an unlikely reply, though there are those who endorse principles of restricted composition that entail that the world does not exist. For instance, van Inwagen 1990 holds that composition only occurs when the result is a life, and the world is (presumably) not a life—a consequence van Inwagen himself later notes and embraces (2002: 127).[20]

So much the worse for such principles of restricted composition, the existence monist might respond. Indeed, there seem to be at least four independent reasons for maintaining that the world exists. First, intuitively, the world seems to exist. We folk speak of “the universe” and “the whole wide world,” while our poets write verses like “All are but parts of one stupendous whole, whose body nature is, and God the soul;” (Alexander Pope; Essay on Man, Epistle I.IX). Second, mereology needs the world. For U is needed to define complementation, where the complement of x is the rest of the world: U−x. A mereology without the world would thus be impoverished.[21] Third, semantics needs the world. Or at least, Lewisian possible world semantics needs the world to serve as actuality. (Or at the very least, those who would reject Lewisian possible world semantics generally do so because of worries about reducing possible worlds, not because of worries about the existence of the actual one!) Fourth, physics needs the world. Here quantum cosmology directly attempts to solve for the wave function of the world.[22]

The existence pluralist might do better to deny 2, by maintaining that composition is identity. If the world is its proper parts, then positing the former just is positing the latter.[23] But there seem to be two main reasons for denying that composition is identity. First, the whole and its parts differ structurally. Pluralities like ‘the parts’ have a privileged structure in terms of their individuals. Thus consider a circle (the whole) divided into two semicircles (the parts). Here the semicircles are structured into a pair of distinct semicircular shapes.[24] But (given mereological extensionality) fusions lack such privileged structure. The circle is just as much the fusion of its two semicircles, as it is the fusion of its four quadrants, and its continuum-many points. Second, the whole and its parts differ numerically. As Lewis writes: “What's true of the many is not exactly what's true of the one. After all they are many while it is one” (1991: 87).[25] So, assuming that the extended many-one conception of identity retains an appropriate analogue of Leibniz's law of the indiscernibility of identicals, the one whole cannot be identical to its many parts.

The existence pluralist might do best to deny 3. One way to deny 3 is to invoke competing methodological considerations. Perhaps Occam's Razor cuts against both explanatorily redundant and epiphenomenal entities, but Occam's Razor is not the only methodological consideration. There are also considerations of conservativeness, that seem to favor an ontology that includes you and I as distinct concrete objects. Though here the existence monist might reply that Occam's Razor trumps conservativeness when the two conflict.

Perhaps a better way for the existence pluralist to deny 3 (and the best overall way for her to reply to the exclusion argument) is to argue that Occam's Razor should be modified to take into account the notion of basicness. For there seems little harm in multiplying entities that are derivative—what seems problematic is the multiplication of basic entities. In this vein Armstrong speaks of ‘the ontological free lunch’: “[W]hatever supervenes, … is not something ontologically additional to the subvenient, or necessitating, entity or entities. What supervenes is no addition to being” (1997: 12). So the existence pluralist might suggest that the better methodological maxim is: do not multiply basic entities without necessity (but help yourself to derivative entities).[26]

Turning to the existence nihilist, she might react to the exclusion argument by claiming to beat the existence monist at her own game. The existence nihilist denies that any concrete objects exist (this is a variant way of denying that the world exists, and so a variant way of denying 1). Just as the complete causal story of the world can be told in terms of the world's having various configurational properties, so the story can be told without mentioning any concrete object at all, and simply speaking of the instantiation of the relevant properties. This involves what Hawthorne and Cortens 1995 (following Strawson 1959) call a ‘feature-placing language.’ Instead of saying that the world has certain properties, a feature-placing language just says that there are those properties, or (to express the same idea in a different way) instead of saying that the world is F, a feature-placing language just says that it Fs, where ‘it’ is understood as a semantically vacuous placeholder that is present for purely syntactic reasons.[27] Here the existence nihilist might claim to beat the monist at her own game, by providing an even simpler sufficient ontology.

Here I think the existence monist should reply that property instantiations metaphysically presuppose concrete objects as the instantiators of such properties.[28] That is, the existence monist should reply that existence nihilism is impossible, for positing properties without bearers. If so then (i) at least one concrete object is required, by the argument that properties need bearers, and (ii) at most one concrete object is required, by the argument from exclusion discussed above.

So much for the exclusion argument. To my knowledge there are two main (related) arguments against existence monism, which is that the existence of a plurality of concrete objects is (i) intuitively obvious, and (ii) perceptually apparent. As far as intuitions, Russell reports:

I share the common-sense belief that there are many separate things; I do not regard the apparent multiplicity of the world as consisting merely in phases and unreal divisions of a single indivisible Reality. (1985: 36)

He adds: “The empirical person would naturally say, there are many things. The monistic philosopher attempts to show that there are not. I should propose to refute his a priori arguments” (1985: 48). Hoffman and Rosenkrantz take a similar line, focusing on the perceptual apparentness of existence pluralism:

Monism has an additional very serious disadvantage: it is inconsistent with something that appears to be an evident datum of experience, namely, that there is a plurality of things. We shall assume that a plurality of material things exists, and hence that monism is false. (1997: 78)

Existence monism seems like a crazy view, whereas existence pluralism seems obviously right. When Moore intones “Here is one hand… and here is another” (1993: 166), we already seem to have an intuitively obvious and perceptually apparent case for there being at least two concrete objects.

How might the existence monist reply? She might attempt to paraphrase claims of commonsense in terms of modes of the world. For instance, when one claims that there is a table here, the existence monist might hold that (i) what is strictly the case is that the world is tableish here.[29] The original utterance could be understood as strictly false but explicable given the truth of the paraphrase, or as true according to the ‘tacit fiction’ of decomposition, which is the ‘fiction’ that the world decomposes into proper parts. Though it is unclear what the existence of such paraphrases shows. Here the situation parallels that of mereological nihilism. The nihilist is also committed to the denial of tables, and will offer paraphrases (‘simples arranged tablewise’) and tacit fictions (the ‘fiction’ of composition).[30] If one takes such paraphrases as capable of lifting ontic commitment, then one is in danger of lifting all ontic commitments. The existence monist must, for instance, deny that the existence nihilist can paraphrase away the intuition that properties need bearers, on pain of being beaten at her own game. Further evaluation of this issue turns on the deeper question of what (if any) role paraphrase should play in ontology, and what (if any) constraints there are on allowable paraphrases.[31]

The existence monist might also offer an indirect correspondence theory of truth. The idea here is to deny the existence of tables and hands, but still maintain the truth of claims such as (i) there is a table here, and (ii) here is one hand and here is another, on grounds that such claims indirectly describe certain features of the world. This is the line taken by Horgan and Potrč, who declare talk of a plurality of discrete objects apt for tracking “lumps” and “congealings” of the blobject, saying that “such tracking would constitute an indirect kind of language/world correspondence” which “would be a very plausible candidate for truth” (2000: 50-1). It is odd though that an existence monist would count claims like “there are many objects” as true. Indeed, the semantics is in danger of generating contradictions. Presumably “there are many objects” will count as true in virtue of there being many lumps in the blobject, and presumably “it is not the case that there are many objects” will count as true in virtue of its direct correspondence with the world. Indeed, if language is always such an indirect tool for talking about the world, it is unclear that ontological inquiry is even possible, because it is unclear that the world would then put substantial enough constraints on what we can truly say. Further evaluation of this issue turns on the deeper question of what (if any) ontological relationships are needed for truth.[32]

Finally the existence monist might simply reject the intuitions of plurality. This would be the most radical move, and also the least plausible. Whatever intuitive support premises 1-3 of the existence monist's exclusion argument might have seems to pale in comparison to the intuitions of plurality. Not for nothing is existence monism widely dismissed as a crazy metaphysic.[33]

3. Priority Monism

Priority monism targets concrete objects and counts by basic tokens. It holds that exactly one basic concrete object exists—there may be many other concrete objects, but these only exist derivatively. The priority monist will hold that the one basic concrete object is the world (the maximal concrete whole). She will allow that the world has proper parts, but hold that the whole is basic and the parts are derivative. In short, she will hold the classical monistic doctrine that the whole is prior to its parts. This doctrine presupposes that the many parts exist, for the whole to be prior to. Historically, priority monism may have been defended by Plato, Plotinus, Proclus, Spinoza, Hegel, Lotze, Royce, Bosanquet, and Bradley, inter alia.[34] But today, priority monism has virtually no advocates.[35] Indeed, priority monism is seldom even recognized as a possible position. ‘Monism’ is typically understood as existence monism (exactly one concrete object exists), and then summarily dismissed.[36]

If one feels the need to find a logical formula to associate with priority monism, one will first need to introduce a predicate ‘B’ that denotes the property of being a basic concrete object. Then one can introduce the formula:

Priority monism: ∃x(Bx & ∀y(By → y=x))

The corresponding logical formulae for priority pluralism and nihilism then run:

Priority pluralism: ∃x∃y(Bx & By & x≠y)

Priority nihilism: ~∃xBx

These are the same formulae as for existence monism/pluralism/nihilism, save for the replacement of ‘C’ with ‘B’. The formulae are thus not particularly interesting. What is more interesting is the property that ‘B’ is supposed to denote. To this I now turn.

3.1 Priority

The notion of basicness is best understood with reference to the classical hierarchical view of reality. The basic forms the sparse structure of being, while the derivative forms the abundant superstructure. The basic is (as it were) all God would need to create, the derivative is a mere byproduct. The derivative is dependent on, grounded in, and existent in virtue of the basic. The basic is what Campbell speaks of as “the ontic constitution of the cosmos” (1990: 24-5). It is fundamental. It is ultimate.

Such a notion of basicness is natural and useful. It has classical roots in Aristotle's notion of priority in nature, and has branched into the contemporary program of sparse ontology, in a way that has proven fruitful in understanding issues of properties, physicalism, reduction, and truthmaking, inter alia. Here are some illustrations. For properties, the physicalist holds that physical properties are basic, and that mental and moral properties are derivative. For the abstract objects of pure set theory, it is natural to think that the empty set is basic, and that the other pure sets are founded on it. For concrete objects, one might hold that the material host is basic and that its holes are formed by it. And across categories, the Aristotelian maintains that objects are basic, and that properties inhere in them. Such talk is now ubiquitous.[37]

More precisely, basicness is to be understood as the lower bound of ontological priority. That is, suppose that one begins with the notion of ontological priority, understood as an irreflexive, asymmetric, and transitive relation between entities.[38] Then ontological priority will induce a partial ordering over the domain of entities. It forges the great chain of being.

Suppose one now adds the assumption that ontological priority relations require foundations. Then there will be a lower-bound on the ontological priority ordering. This lower-bound will encompass those entities that are not posterior to any other entities. These are the basic entities. They are the ground of reality, the foundation post for the great chain of being.

Suppose one now adds a third assumption that there are ontological dependency relations with foundations, within the domain of concrete objects. Then there will be basic concrete objects. In Aristotelian terminology, these are the substances.[39]

Putting this together, the notion of a basic object flows from the following notions:

Ontological priority: there is an irreflexive, asymmetric, and transitive relation of ontological priority between entities.

Ontological foundationalism: the ontological priority relation is lower-bounded.

Concreta foundationalism: there are lower-bounded ontological priority relations within the domain of concrete objects.

It remains to clarify and motivate these three assumptions.

Starting with ontological priority, this is a natural and useful notion. I will not attempt an account of this notion here, but will suppose it clear enough to work with.[40] At the least, priority seems no worse than notions such as parthood and causation. Priority, parthood, and causation are all natural and useful notions, which can be illuminated by glosses and examples (even if no one has ever successfully analyzed any of them). So one might say that ontological priority is on par with other metaphysically respectable notions. Or at least, the philosopher who would still scorn the notion of priority should say what is especially problematic about it.

Turning to ontological foundationalism, this assumption can be analyzed in terms of ontological priority. It is the assumption that all chains of priority are lower-bounded. More precisely, a foundational entity is one that has nothing prior to it:

Foundational entities: Fx =df ~∃yPyx

Here ‘P’ denotes the ontological priority relation. Ontological foundationalism may then be formulated as the following thesis:

Ontological foundationalism: ∀x(Fx or ∃y(Fy & Pyx))

In words, ontological foundationalism holds that every entity is either basic or posterior to something basic. In content, what ontological foundationalism excludes is a scenario of limitless dependence, in which chains of ontological priority never hit bedrock.

The reason for accepting ontological foundationalism is the metaphysical intuition that being requires an ultimate ground. Without ontologically basic entities, being would be endlessly deferred, never achieved.[41] By way of analogy, consider the parable of all God would need to do. Without ontologically basic entities, there would be no sense to such a parable. What would God need to do, to create a baseless world? Where could He begin?[42]

Moving finally to object foundationalism, such an assumption can be analyzed in terms of priority plus concreteness. It is the assumption of foundationalism for concrete objects. More precisely, a basic concretum is a concrete object that has no concrete object prior to it:

Basic concreta: Bx =df Cx & ~∃y(Cy & Pyx)

Here ‘C’ continues to denote the property of being a concrete object (as per the formulation of existence monism: §2), and ‘P’ the priority relation. This defines the predicate ‘B’ used in the formulations of priority monism, pluralism, and nihilism above. Object foundationalism may then be defined as the following thesis:

Concreta foundationalism: ∀x(Cx → (Bx vel ∃y(By & Pyx)))

In words, concreta foundationalism holds that every concrete object is either basic-among-the-concreta or posterior to something basic-among-the-concreta. In content, what concreta foundationalism excludes is a scenario of limitless concretion, in which chains of ontological priority among the concreta never hit bedrock.[43]

The reason for accepting concreta foundationalism is that it follows from ontological foundationalism, together with virtually any account of concrete objects. An account of concrete objects must either take them to be basic or derivative. If concreta are basic (as for instance on the nominalist view) then ontological foundationalism entails concreta foundationalism directly. While if concreta are derivative (perhaps as hylomorphic compounds of matter and form, or perhaps as bundles of compresent tropes) then there should be basic entities among the categories that objects are derivative from (matter/form, tropes, or whatnot). The basic entities among these categories will then serve as the objectmakers for the basic objects (while the derivative entities among these categories will serve as the objectmakers for the derivative objects). To illustrate: if objects are bundles of compresent tropes, and the basic tropes are all instantiated at points, then the compresent basic point-tropes will serve as objectmakers for the basic concreta, which would then be basic point particles.

The debate between the priority monist and the priority pluralist is over what is at the lower-bound of the priority relation on concrete objects. The priority monist holds that whole is prior to part, and that the maximal whole is ultimately prior. The priority pluralist holds that part is prior to whole, and that the minimal parts are ultimately prior. This is not a debate over what exists. Both sides may accept the same roster of existent beings (including the world, you and I, planets and particles, etc.) This is a debate over what is basic. It is a debate over the structure of what exists. It is a debate over how (as it were) God made the world: did God make the world piecemeal, or the whole thing in one flash?

3.2 Priority Monism

What arguments might be given for whether the one whole or its many parts is basic? I will articulate four arguments (two for the monist, two for the pluralist), and briefly mention some possible replies.[44] As the terrain here is largely unexplored, I will not attempt to map the dialectic further, but rather hope to inspire others to explore this forgotten terrain themselves.

3.2.1 The Argument from Commonsense

The first argument to consider is the argument from commonsense. This argument, which is an argument for priority pluralism, may be posed as follows:

  1. Commonsense holds that part is prior to whole.
  2. If commonsense holds that part is prior to whole, then there is reason for thinking that part is prior to whole.
  3. There is reason for thinking that part is prior to whole.

The argument is obviously valid, so the only remaining questions concern the truth of the premises 5 and 6.

As to 5, consider the grains of sand in the heap. Here it seems that the grains are prior—the heap exists in virtue of the grains. Or consider the tiles in the mosaic. Here it seems that the tiles are prior—the mosaic is just an arrangement of tiles. Or consider the individuals in a community. Here it seems that the individuals are prior—the community is just a grouping of individuals. In all these cases, it seems that part is prior to whole. Thus Leibniz maintains that, in general, “a composite is nothing else than a collection or aggregatum of simple substances” (1714: 455).

Yet also consider some gerrymandered division of a circle. Here it seems that the circle is prior—the gerrymander is just an arbitrary partition on the circle. Or consider the organs of the body. Here it seems that the body is prior—the organs are just functional portions of the body. Or consider the myriad details of the percept. Here it seems that the percept is prior—the details are just particulars of the gestalt. In these latter cases, it seems that whole is prior to part.[45]

Generalizing, it seems that commonsense actually has a relatively nuanced stance on priority relations between whole and part. Commonsense endorses the priority of the parts in cases of mere aggregation and arrangement, and the priority of the whole in cases of arbitrary decompositions, functionally integrated systems, and mental unities.[46] Overall commonsense seems to distinguish between mere heaps and genuine unities. On this point Aristotle speaks of “that which is compounded out of something so that the whole is one—not like a heap, but like a syllable…” (Meta.1041b11-2)

So it remains, in evaluating 5, to ask whether commonsense conceives of the world as a mere heap or a genuine unity. Here the priority monist might invoke the following passage from Blanshard:

We are convinced that [Russell's atomistic conclusion] will not stand. Our conviction is essentially that of the plain man. Intuitions may be of small weight in philosophy, but…the ‘invincible surmise’ of most thoughtful minds [is] that the world is not in the final account a rag-bag of loose ends… (1973: 180)

Indeed, as James notes in the course of defending pluralism (which he took to be a radical doctrine), virtually all (pre-twentieth century) philosophers have conceived of the world as a genuine unity:

Whether materialistically or spiritually minded, philosophers have always aimed at cleaning up the litter with which the world apparently is filled. They have substituted economical and orderly conceptions for the first sensible tangle; and whether these were morally elevated or only intellectually neat, they were at any rate always aesthetically pure and definite, and aimed at ascribing to the world something clean and intellectual in the way of inner structure. (1909: 650)[47]

So the priority monist should conclude that, if anything, the argument from commonsense should be reversed. Commonsense does see the cosmos as more of a genuine unity than a mere heap (more like a syllable than a heap of sand). One more passage from James may be useful here:

A certain abstract monism, a certain emotional response to the character of oneness, as if it were a feature of the world not coordinate with its manyness, but vastly more excellent and eminent, is so prevalent in educated circles that we might almost call it part of philosophic common sense. (1991: 59)

In any case, as to 6, it is not obvious that commonsense is entitled to much of an opinion here. One might well think that here the use of intuitions is particularly perilous, since the notion of ontological priority is a sophisticated philosophical notion. I would suggest that even if commonsense leans slightly towards priority monism (as the overall history of metaphysics bears out), this should not matter much. To the extent it provides a reason to favor priority monism, it is a weak reason indeed.

3.2.2 The Argument from Emergence

The second argument to consider is the argument from emergence. This argument, which is an argument for priority monism by way of quantum mechanics, may be posed as follows:

  1. The whole possesses emergent properties (due to quantum entanglement).
  2. If the whole possesses emergent properties, then whole is prior to part.
  3. Whole is prior to part.

The argument is obviously valid, so the only remaining questions concern the truth of the premises 8 and 9.

As to 8, the intended notion of an emergent property is one for which mereological supervenience fails. Let x have proper parts. Then F is an emergent property of x iff (i) x instantiates F, (ii) F is an intrinsic property, and (iii) x's instantiating F does not supervene on the intrinsic properties of, and spatiotemporal relations among, x's proper parts. Such a property would be an intrinsic property of the whole that is not determined by the intrinsic properties of and spatiotemporal relations among its parts.

Such emergent properties are found in the entangled systems of quantum mechanics. An entangled system is one whose state vector is not factorizable into tensor products of the state vectors of its components:
Ψsystem ≠ Ψcomponent1 product Ψcomponent2 product Ψcomponent3 product …

What this inequality means is that the quantum state of an entangled system contains information over and above that of the quantum states of the components. The intrinsic properties of entangled wholes do not supervene on the intrinsic properties of and spatiotemporal relations among their parts. Here Esfeld notes:

In the case of entanglement, it is only the description of the whole in terms of a pure state, such as the singlet state, which completely determines the local properties of the parts and their relations…  Therefore, quantum physics exhibits a substantial holism. (1999: 26)

In a similar vein, Maudlin concludes:

The physical state of a complex whole cannot always be reduced to those of its parts, or to those of its parts together with their spatiotemporal relations, even when the parts inhabit distinct regions of space… The result of the most intensive scientific investigations in history is a theory that contains an ineliminable holism. (1998: 56)

Entangled systems are wholes that contain new information, found in the correlation coefficients of their wave functions.

There is reason to think that the world forms a single entangled system, due to the fact that everything interacted in the Big Bang. Everything is a shard of the primordial atom. As Gribbin explains:

Particles that were together in an interaction remain in some sense parts of a single system, which responds together to further interactions. Virtually everything we see and touch and feel is made up of collections of particles that have been involved in interactions with other particles right back through time, to the Big Bang… Indeed, the particles that make up my body once jostled in close proximity and interacted with the particles that now make up your body. We are as much parts of a single system as the two photons flying out of the heart of the Aspect experiment (1984: 229)

Here Zeh notes that, given quantum decoherence, all seemingly localized particlesque behavior “can be dynamically described in terms of a unitarily evolving (hence strongly entangled) universal wave function” (2003: 33). Thus there is reason to think that the whole possesses emergent properties, as 8 maintains.

I think the best line for the priority pluralist to take here is to deny 8, by holding that (i) entanglement represents a new fundamental relation between individual particles (as opposed to a new emergent property of whole systems), and (ii) mereological supervenience should be revised to concern the supervenience of the intrinsic properties of wholes on the intrinsic properties of their parts plus any fundamental (as opposed to merely spatiotemporal) relations among their parts. Entangled quantum systems so understood will now count as mereologically supervenient so understood. This takes us into deep issues about mereological supervenience, and especially about the status of particles in quantum theory.[48]

As to 9, the idea is that a whole that does possess emergent properties is thereby ‘more than the sum of its parts.’ Thus consider the entangled quantum universe. As Toraldo di Francia aptly summarizes: “Since any particle has certainly interacted with other particles in the past, the world turns out to be nonseparable into individual and independent objects. The world is in some way a single object” (1998: 28). Likewise Nadeau and Kafatos say: “If nonlocality is a property of the entire universe, then we must also conclude that an undivided wholeness exists on the most basic and primary level in all aspects of physical reality” (1999: 4), and then go on to speak of “a seamlessly interconnected whole called the cosmos” (1999: 5). This suggests that it is the whole that is basic and the parts derivative, as the priority monist maintains.

3.2.3 The Argument from Heterogeneity

The third argument to consider is the argument from heterogeneity. This argument, which is an argument for priority pluralism, may be posed as follows:

  1. Fundamental entities must be homogeneous.
  2. If the whole world were fundamental, then the whole world would be homogeneous.
  3. The whole world is not homogeneous.
  4. The whole world is not fundamental.

The argument is obviously valid, so the only remaining questions concern the truth of the premises 11–13.[49]

I take the truth of 13 to be evident. There is qualitative variation in the world. The world is not a perfectly homogeneous Parmenidean sphere:

But since there is a furthest limit, it is complete on every side, like the body of a well-rounded sphere, evenly balanced in every direction from the middle; for it cannot be any greater or any less in one place than in another. (Robinson 1968: 115)

So the question is whether priority monism can account for heterogeneity. Further, I take 12 to follow from 11. So the real question comes down to the status of 11.

Why think that fundamental entities must be homogeneous (as per 11)? Here are the best two (related) attempts I can make at defending 11. First attempt: nothing can differ from itself. For a fundamental entity to be heterogeneous would be for it to be internally diverse, which would render it different from itself.[50] Second attempt: the priority pluralist has a way of accounting for heterogeneity that the monist lacks. The pluralist has many fundamental entities, which may all be homogeneous, but might still be different from each other. Hence if the only way to account for heterogeneity were to have many fundamental homogeneous parts differing from each other, then the priority pluralist would have the only way to account for heterogeneity. Perhaps this line of thought is behind the following passage from Turner:

The weak point of all metaphysical Monism is its inability to explain how, if there is but one reality, and everything else is only apparent there can be any real changes in the world, or real relations among things (1911).

Having made an attempt to defend 11, I now turn to replies on behalf of the priority monist. The starting reply is that internal heterogeneity within the basic must be allowed by everyone. Or at least, the priority pluralist's way of accounting for heterogeneity (above) is insufficient to account for all forms of heterogeneity. For there might be heterogeneity all the way down, in the sense of matter every part of which has heterogeneous proper parts.[51] If this is possible, it shows that the pluralistic strategy of accounting for heterogeneity in terms of differences between internally homogeneous parts is insufficient. It must be possible to account for heterogeneity in other ways. It remains to describe these ways.

What is needed is to find ways to allow for heterogeneity, which would not entail that anything is ‘different from itself.’ Here are three possibilities, the first of which is to use distributional properties.[52] The world might, for instance, have the property of being polka-dotted. Here there would be no question of the world being ‘different from itself,’ or having any other problematic status. The claim that the world is polka-dotted is a coherent claim, which would entail heterogeneity among its derivative dots and background.

The second way to allow for heterogeneity without contradiction is to relationalize properties. Here the idea (for monadic properties at least) is that instantiation is a three-place relation holding between an object, a property, and a region. So the world might be heterogeneous by, for instance, instantiating red here and green there.[53]

The third way to allow for heterogeneity without contradiction is to regionalize instantiation. Here the idea is that, instead of regionalizing the properties, one might regionalize the instantiation relation itself. So the world might be heterogeneous by, for instance, instantiating-here red and instantiating-there green. (Since the regionalization is incorporated into the copula rather than the predicate, this may be expressed adverbially, as “the world is here-ly red and there-ly green,” or “the world is red in a here-ly way, and green in a there-ly way.”[54])

Perhaps there is a better way to defend 11, and perhaps there are problems with all three of the monistic strategies I have sketched (distributional properties, relationalized properties, and regionalized instantiations). This takes us deeper into issues about objects and properties.[55]

3.2.4 The Argument from Gunk

The fourth and final argument I will consider here is the argument from gunk. This argument, which is an argument for priority monism, may be posed as follows:

  1. Either the ultimate parts must be basic at all worlds, or the ultimate whole must be basic at all worlds.
  2. There are gunky worlds without ultimate parts (and hence no ultimate parts to be basic at those worlds).
  3. The ultimate whole must be basic at all worlds.

The argument is obviously valid, so the only remaining questions concern the truth of the premises 15 and 16.

As to 15, the idea is that the direction of priority must be a necessary truth. It would be odd if there were worlds that were otherwise indiscernible, save for differing over what was prior to what. The direction of priority seems to have the same status as other fundamental metaphysical claims (e.g., the debate over universals).[56] To know the direction of priority seems to be part of what Rosen has in mind when he speaks of knowing:

…what might be called the form of the world: principles governing how objects in general are put together. If the world is a text then these principles constitute its syntax. They specify the categories of basic constituents and the rules for their combination. They determine how non-basic entities are generated from or ‘grounded’ in the basic array. (2006: 35)

That said, I would expect the priority pluralist to challenge 15, for one of the following two reasons. First, the priority pluralist might (on considering gunk, and maintaining her thesis that the parts are prior to the whole) declare that nothing is basic in gunky worlds. Things get ever more basic without limit. But this would run counter to ontological foundationalism, and the widespread idea that being needs an ultimate ground (§3.1).

Second, the priority pluralist might (on wanting to maintain basic entities in a gunky scenario, but not wanting to take the whole as basic) take some intermediate level of mereological structure to be basic. But this is hardly thematic for the pluralist, as now she would be treating these intermediate structures monistically, as prior to their parts. In any case it seems arbitrary, especially in cases where there is no natural joint in the gunk. For instance, in the case of a homogeneously pink cube of gunk, all the levels of mereological structure (save for the top) are intermediate, and all are homogeneously pink. Is there supposed to be a fact of the matter as to which intermediate level is really basic?

Turning finally to 16, I think there is good reason for thinking that there are gunky worlds. The best tests for whether a scenario is possible are whether it is conceivable, logically consistent, and posited in serious scientific theories. Gunk passes every test (Schaffer 2003). It is conceivable. For instance, it is conceivable that everything is extended, and that everything that is extended has two extended halves. This generates a Zeno sequence of halvings without limit. Further, gunk is logically consistent. Or at least, there are gunky models of classical mereology (Simons 1987: 41). Finally, gunk is scientifically serious. In this vein Georgi has suggested that effective quantum field theories might form an infinite tower which “goes down to arbitrary short distances in a kind of infinite regression… just a series of layers without end” (1989: 456). Perhaps there are competing considerations that weigh against the possibility of gunk. Here we enter into deep issues concerning the extent of what is possible.[57]

Obviously there is a great deal more that could be said here. I think it fair though to draw two conclusions at this point. First, there are no strong arguments against priority monism. Or at least, neither of the two arguments against priority monism surveyed here (the arguments from commonsense and from heterogeneity) seem overly powerful.[58] Second, there are some decent arguments for priority monism. Or at least, both of the two arguments for priority monism surveyed here (the arguments from emergence and from gunk) seem to have some force. It would be premature to declare victory for either side. But perhaps it would not be premature to declare that priority monism is worth at least taking seriously once again.

Bibliography

Other Internet Resources

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Related Entries

abstract objects | Bradley, Francis Herbert | categories | dependence, ontological | dualism | emergent properties | Hegel, Georg Wilhelm Friedrich | mereology | mereology: medieval | neutral monism | physics: holism and nonseparability | Plotinus | quantum theory: quantum field theory | Spinoza, Baruch | substance

Acknowledgments

Thanks to Dean Zimmerman for helpful comments.