Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
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Nothingness

First published Thu Aug 28, 2003; substantive revision Wed Aug 30, 2006

Since metaphysics is the study of what exists, one might expect metaphysicians to have little to say about the limit case in which nothing exists. But ever since Parmenides in the fifth century B.C., there has been rich commentary on whether an empty world is possible, whether there are vacuums, and about the nature of privations and negation.

This survey starts with nothingness at a global scale and then explores local pockets of nothingness. Let's begin with a question that Martin Heidegger famously characterized as the most fundamental issue of philosophy.

1. Why is there something rather than nothing?

Well, why not? Why expect nothing rather than something? No experiment could support the hypothesis ‘There is nothing’ because any observation obviously implies the existence of an observer.

Is there any a priori support for ‘There is nothing’? One might respond with a methodological principle that propels the empty world to the top of the agenda. For instance, many feel that whoever asserts the existence of something has the burden of proof. If an astronomer says there is water at the south pole of the Moon, then it is up to him to provide data in support of the lunar water. If we were not required to have evidence to back our existential claims, then a theorist who fully explained the phenomena with one set of things could gratuitously add an extra entity, say, Atlantis. We recoil from such add-ons. To prevent the intrusion of superfluous entities, one might demand that metaphysicians start with the empty world and admit only those entities that have credentials. This is the regime imposed by Rene Descartes. He clears everything out and then only lets back in what can be proved to exist.

St. Augustine had more conservative counsel: we should not start at the beginning, nor at the end, but where we are, in the middle. We reach a verdict about the existence of controversial things by assessing how well these entities would harmonize with the existence of better established things. If we start from nothing, we lack the bearings needed to navigate forward. Conservatives, coherentists and scientific gradualists all cast a suspicious eye on ‘Why there is something rather than nothing?’.

Most contemporary philosophers feel entitled to postulate whatever entities are indispensable to their best explanations of well accepted phenomena. They feel the presumption of non-existence is only plausible for particular existence claims. Since the presumption only applies on a case by case basis, there is no grand methodological preference for an empty world. Furthermore, there is no burden of proof when everybody concedes the proposition under discussion. Even a solipsist agrees there is at least one thing!

A more popular way to build a presumption in favor of nothingness is to associate nothingness with simplicity and simplicity with likelihood. The first part of this justification is plausible. ‘Nothing exists’ is simple in the sense of being an easy to remember generalization. Consider a test whose questions have the form ‘Does x exist?’. The rule ‘Always answer no!’ is unsurpassably short and comprehensive.

In Les Misérables, Victor Hugo contrasts universal negation with universal affirmation:

All roads are blocked to a philosophy which reduces everything to the word ‘no.’ To ‘no’ there is only one answer and that is ‘yes.’ Nihilism has no substance. There is no such thing as nothingness, and zero does not exist. Everything is something. Nothing is nothing. Man lives more by affirmation than by bread. (1862, pt. 2, bk. 7, ch. 6).

As far as simplicity, there is a tie between the nihilistic rule ‘Always answer no!’ and the inflationary rule ‘Always answer yes!’. Neither rule makes for serious metaphysics.

Even if ‘Nothing exists’ were the uniquely simplest possibility (as measured by memorability), why should we expect that possibility to be actual? In a fair lottery, we assign the same probability of winning to the ticket unmemorably designated 6,437,446 as to the ticket memorably labeled 1,111,111.

Indeed, the analogy with a lottery seems to dramatically reverse the presumption of non-existence. If there is only one empty world and many populated worlds, then a random selection would lead us to expect a populated world.

Peter van Inwagen (1996) has nurtured this statistical argument. In an infinite lottery, the chance that a given ticket is the winner is 0. So van Inwagen reasons that since there are infinitely many populated worlds, the probability of a populated world is equal to 1. Although the empty world is not impossible, it is as improbable as anything can be!

For the sake of balanced reporting, van Inwagen should acknowledge that, by his reasoning, the actual world is also as improbable as anything can be. What really counts here is the probability of ‘There is something’ as opposed to ‘There is nothing’.

2. Is there at most one empty world?

Most philosophers would grant Peter van Inwagen's premise that there is no more than one empty world. They have been trained to model the empty world on the empty set. Since a set is defined in terms of its members, there can be at most one empty set.

But several commentators on the nature of laws are pluralists about empty worlds (Carroll 1994, 64). They think empty worlds can be sorted in terms of the generalizations that govern them. Newton's first law of motion says an undisturbed object will continue in motion in a straight line. Aristotle's physics suggests that such an object will slow down and tend to travel in a circle. The Aristotelian empty world differs from the Newtonian empty world because different counterfactual statements are true of it.

If variation in empty worlds can be sustained by differences in the laws that apply to them, there will be infinitely many empty worlds. The gravitational constant of an empty world can equal any real number between 0 and 1, so there are more than countably many empty worlds. Indeed, any order of infinity achieved by the set of populated possible worlds will be matched by the set of empty worlds.

This is true even if we restrict attention to laws that preclude all objects and therefore only govern empty worlds. Consider a law that requires any matter to adjoin an equal quantity of anti-matter. The principles of matter and anti-matter ensure that they cannot co-exist so the result would be an empty world.

Advocates of the fine tuning argument (a descendent of the design argument) claim that the conditions under which life can develop are so delicate that the existence of observers indicates divine intervention. One can imagine a similar sort of argument that stresses what a narrow range of laws permit the formation of concrete entities. From the perspective of these fine tuners, the existence of a universe with concrete entities is an inspiring surprise.

Some existentialists picture nothingness as a kind of force that impedes each object's existence. Since there is something rather than nothing, any such nihilating force cannot have actually gone unchecked. What could have blocked it? Robert Nozick (1981, 123) toys with an interpretation of Heidegger in which this nihilating force is self-destructive. This kind of double-negation is depicted in the Beatles's movie The Yellow Submarine. There is a creature that zooms around like a vacuum cleaner, emptying everything in its path. When this menace finally turns on itself, a richly populated world pops into existence.

Some cultures have creation myths reminiscent of The Yellow Submarine. Heidegger would dismiss them as inappropriately historical. ‘Why is there something rather than nothing?’ is not about the origin of the world. Increasing the scientific respectability of the creation story (as with the Big Bang hypothesis) would still leave Heidegger objecting that the wrong question is being addressed.

3. Can there be an explanatory framework for the question?

Some would disagree with Van Inwagen's assumption that each possible worlds is as likely as any other. There have been metaphysical systems that favor less populated worlds.

Gottfried Leibniz pictured possible things as competing to become actual. The more a thing competes with other things, the more likely that there will be something that stops it from becoming real.

On the one hand, this metaphysical preference for simplicity is heartening because it suggests that the actual world is not too complex for human understanding. Scientists have penetrated deeply into the physical world with principles that emphasize simplicity and uniformity: Ockham's razor, the least effort principle, the anthropic principle, etc.

On the other hand, Leibniz worried that the metaphysical preference for simplicity, when driven to its logical conclusion, yields the embarrassing prediction that there is nothing. After all, an empty world would be free of objects trying to elbow each other out. It is the easiest universe to produce. (Just do nothing!) So why is there is something rather than nothing?

Leibniz's worry requires a kind of limbo between being and non-being. If the things in this limbo state do not really exist, how could they prevent anything else from existing?

Leibniz's limbo illustrates an explanatory trap. To explain why something exists, we standardly appeal to the existence of something else. There are mountain ranges on Earth because there are plates on its surface that slowly collide and crumple up against each other. There are rings around Saturn because there is an immense quantity of rubble orbiting that planet. This pattern of explanation is not possible for ‘Why is there something rather than nothing’. For instance, if we answer ‘There is something because the Universal Designer wanted there to be something’, then our explanation takes for granted the existence of the Universal Designer. Someone who poses the question in a comprehensive way will not grant the existence of the Universal Designer as a starting point.

If the explanation cannot begin with some entity, then it is hard to see how any explanation is feasible. Some philosophers conclude ‘Why is there something rather than nothing?’ is unanswerable. They think the question stumps us by imposing an impossible explanatory demand, namely, Deduce the existence of something without using any existential premises. Logicians should feel no more ashamed of their inability to perform this deduction than geometers should feel ashamed at being unable to square the circle.

David Hume offers a consolation prize: we might still be able explain the existence of each event even if it is impossible to explain everything all together. Suppose that the universe is populated with an infinite row of dominoes. The fall of each domino can be explained by the fall of its predecessor.

Hume denied that the existence of anything could be proved by reason alone. But rationalists have been more optimistic. Many have offered a priori proofs of God's existence. Such a proof would double as an explanation of why there is something. If God exists, then something exists. After all, God is something.

But would God be the right sort of something? If we are only seeking an a priori proof of something (anything at all!), then why not rest content with a mathematical demonstration that there exists an even prime number?

4. The restriction to concrete entities

Van Inwagen's answer is that we are actually interested in concrete things. A concrete entity has a position in space and time. A grain of sand, a camel, and an oasis are each concrete objects.

All material things must be concrete things but some concrete things might be immaterial. Shadows and holes have locations and durations but they are not made of anything material. There is extraneous light in shadows and extraneous matter in holes; but these are contaminants rather than constituents. If there are souls or Cartesian minds, then they will also qualify as immaterial, concrete entities. Although they do not take up space, they take up time. An idealist such as George Berkeley could still ask ‘Why is there is something rather than nothing?’ even though he was convinced that material things are not possible.

Although all concrete things are in space or time, neither space nor time are concrete things. If they were, there would be an infinite regress. Space would have to be contained in another higher space. Time would be dated within another time.

Could two empty worlds differ in virtue of having different kinds of space or time? Perhaps one empty world is a two dimensional Flatland, while another empty world is a three dimensional world. Algebraically, we can get more dimensions by adding more variables, so there may be infinitely many kinds of space.

5. The contingency dilemma

All concrete things appear to be contingent beings. For instance, the Earth would not have existed had the matter which now constitutes our solar system formed, as usual, two stars instead of one. If no concrete thing is a necessary being, then none of them can explain the existence of concrete things.

Even if God is not concrete, proof of His existence would raise hope of explaining the existence of concrete things. For instance, the Genesis creation story suggests that God made the Earth and that He had a reason to do so. If this account could be corroborated we would have an explanation of why the Earth exists and why we exist.

This divine explanation threatens to over-explain the data. Given that God is a necessary being and that the existence of God necessitates the existence of the Earth, then the Earth would be a necessary being rather than a contingent being.

The dilemma was generalized by William Rowe (1975). Consider all the contingent truths. The conjunction of all these truths is itself a contingent truth. On the one hand, this conjunction cannot be explained by any contingent truth because the conjunction already contains all contingent truths; the explanation would be circular. On the other hand, this conjunction cannot be explained by a necessary truth because a necessary truth can only imply other necessary truths. This dilemma suggests that ‘Why are there any contingent beings?’ is impossible to answer.

Rowe's dilemma is only an obstacle if an empty world is a genuine possibility. Otherwise, the retort to ‘Why is there something rather than nothing?’ is ‘There is no alternative to there being something’.

‘There might be nothing’ is false when read epistemically. (Roughly, a proposition is epistemically possible if it is true for all we know.) For we know that something actually exists and knowledge of actuality precludes epistemic possibility. But when read metaphysically, ‘There might be nothing’ seems true. So ‘Why is there something rather than nothing?’ is, so far, a live question.

The question is not undermined by the a priori status of knowledge that something exist. (I know a priori that something exists because I know a priori that I exist and know this entails ‘Something exists’.) Knowledge, even a priori knowledge, that something is actually true is compatible with ignorance as to how it could be true.

Residual curiosity is possible even when the the proposition is known to be a necessary truth. A reductio ad absurdum proof that 1 − 1/3 + 1/5 − 1/7 + … converges to π/4 might persuade me that there is no alternative without illuminating how it could be true. For this coarse style of proof does not explain how π wandered into the solution. (Reductio ad absurdum just shows a contradiction would follow.) This raises the possibility that even a logical demonstration of the metaphysical necessity of ‘Something exists’ might still leave us asking why there is something rather than nothing (though there would no longer be the wonder about the accidentality of there being something).

6. The intuitive primacy of positive truths

Henri Bergson maintained that nothingness is precluded by the positive nature of reality. The absence of a female pope is not a brute fact. ‘There is not a female pope’ is made true by a positive fact such as the Catholic Church's regulation that all priests be men and the practice of drawing popes from the priesthood. Once we have the positive facts and the notion of negation, we can derive all the negative facts. ‘There is nothing’ would be a contingent, negative fact. But then it would have to be grounded on some positive reality. That positive reality would ensure that there is something rather than nothing.

Human beings have a strong intuition that positive truths, such as ‘Elephants are huge’ are more fundamental than negative truths such as ‘Elephants do not jump’. The robustness of this tendency makes negative things objects of amusement. Consider the Professor's remark during his chilly banquet in Lewis Carroll's Sylvie and Bruno Concluded.

"I hope you'll enjoy the dinner — such as it is; and that you won't mind the heat — such as it isn't."

The sentence sounded well, but somehow I couldn't quite understand it … (chapter 22)

How can we perceive absences? They seem causally inert and so not the sort of thing that we could check empirically. Negative truths seem redundant; there are no more truths than those entailed by the conjunction of all positive truths. The negative truths seem psychological; we only assert negative truths to express a frustrated expectation. When Jean Paul Sartre (1969, 41) arrives late for his appointment with Pierre at the cafe, he sees the absence of Pierre but not the absence of the Duke of Wellington.

Philosophers have had much trouble vindicating any of these intuitions. Bertrand Russell (1985) labored mightily to reduce negative truths to positive truths. Russell tried paraphrasing ‘The cat is not on the mat’ as ‘There is a state of affairs incompatible with the cat being on the mat’. But this paraphrase is covertly negative; it uses ‘incompatible’ which means not compatible. He tried understanding ‘Not p’ as an expression of disbelief that p. But ‘disbelief’ means believing that something is not the case. Is it even clear that absences are causally inert? Trapped miners are killed by the absence of oxygen. In the end Russell gave up. In a famous lecture at Harvard, Russell concluded that irreducibly negative facts exist. He reports this nearly caused a riot.

Were it not for the threat to social order, one might stand the intuition on its head: Negative truths are more fundamental than positive truths. From a logical point of view, there is greater promise in a reduction of positive truths to negative truths. Positive truths can be analyzed as the negations of negative truths or perhaps as frustrated disbelief. Positive truths would then be the redundant hanger-ons, kept in circulation by our well-documented difficulty in coping with negative information. Think of photographic negatives. They seem less informative than positive prints. But since the prints are manufactured from the negatives, the negatives must be merely more difficult for us to process.

We will engage in negative thinking to avoid highly complicated positive thinking. What is the probability of getting at least one head in ten tosses of a coin? Instead of directly computing the probability of this highly disjunctive positive event, we switch to a negative perspective. We first calculate the probability of an absence of heads and then exploit the complement rule: Probability (at least one head) = 1 − Probability (no heads).

Some possible worlds are easier to contemplate negatively. Thales said that all is water. Suppose he was nearly right except for the existence of two bubbles. These two absences of water become the interesting players (just as two drops of water in an otherwise empty space become interesting players in the dual of this universe). How would these bubbles relate to each other? Would they repel each other? Would they be mutually unaffected? Deep thinking about gravity yields the conclusion that the bubbles would attract each other! (Epstein 1983, 138-9)

The hazard of drawing metaphysical conclusions from psychological preferences is made especially vivid by caricatures. We know that caricatures are exaggerated representations. Despite the flagrant distortion (and actually because of it) we more easily recognize people from caricatures rather than from faithful portraits (once we control for the sort of variables itemized in Superportraits: Caricatures and Recognition).

For navigational purposes, we prefer simplified subway maps over ones that do justice to the lengths and curves of the track lines. Possibly an accurate, composite map of reality could be averaged out from maps that caricature different aspects of the world. Possibly not.

Our predilection for positive thinking could reflect an objective feature of our world (instead of being a mere anthropocentric projection of one style of thought). But if this objective positiveness is itself contingent, then it does not explan why there is something rather than nothing. For Bergson's explanation to succeed, the positive nature of reality needs to be a metaphysically necessary feature.

7. The subtraction argument

To many, the possibility of an empty world seems self-evident. Nevertheless, Thomas Baldwin (1996) reinforces the possibility of an empty world by refining the following argument: Imagine each object vanishing in sequence. Eventually you run down to three objects, two objects, one object and then Poof! There's your empty world.

A number of philosophers complain that this subtraction argument is fallacious. The fact that it is possible for each object to not exist is compatible with it being necessary that at least one object exists.

The founder of modal logic, Aristotle, has special reason to deny that ‘Necessarily (p or q)’ entails ‘Necessarily p or necessarily q’. Aristotle believed that all abstract entities depend on concrete entities for their existence. Yet he also believed that there are necessary truths. The existence any particular individual is contingent but it is necessary that some individuals exist.

Science textbooks teem with contingent abstract entities: the equator, Jupiter's center of gravity, NASA's space budget, etc. Twentieth century mathematics makes sets central. Sets are defined in terms of their members. Therefore, any set that contains a contingent entity is itself a contingent entity. The set that contains you is an abstract entity that has no weight or color or electric charge. But it still depends on you for its existence.

Mathematics can be reconstructed in terms of sets given the assumption that something exists. From you we derive the set containing you, then the set containing that set, then the set containing that larger set, and so on. Through ingenious machinations, all of mathematics can be reconstructed from sets. Contemporary set theorists like to spin this amazing structure from the empty set so as to not assume the existence of contingent beings. This is the closest mathematicians get to creation from nothing!

Early set theorists and several contemporary metaphysicians reject the empty set. Yet the loveliness of the construction makes many receptive to Wesley Salmon's ontological argument: "The fool saith in his heart that there is no empty set. But if that were so, then the set of all such sets would be empty, and hence it would be the empty set."

E. J. Lowe argues on behalf of the fool: "A set has these [well-defined identity conditions] only to the extent that its members do--but the empty set has none. Many things have no members: what makes just one of these qualify as ‘the empty set’" (1996, 116 fn.) Since mathematical statements such as ‘The first prime number after 1,000,000 is 1,000,003’ are necessary truths and can only be rendered true by the existence of a contingent being, Lowe concludes that there necessarily exists at least one contingent being. In other words, the empty world is impossible even if there are no necessary beings.

There are other metaphysical systems that make the existence of some concrete entities necessary without implying that there are any necessarily existing concrete things. Like Ludwig Wittgenstein during his Tractatus phase, D. M. Armstrong (1989) takes a world to be a totality of facts. A fact consists of one or more objects related to each other in a certain way. By an act of selective attention, we concentrate on just the objects or just the relations. But they are always inextricably bound up with each other. Since every fact requires at least one object, a world without objects would be a world without facts. But a factless world is a contradiction in terms. Therefore, the empty world is impossible.

Even classical logic militates against the empty world. Since its universal quantifier has existential import, each of its logical laws imply that something exists. For instance, the principle of identity, Everything is identical to itself entails There exists something that is identical to itself. All sorts of attractive inferences are jeopardized by the empty world.

Logicians do not treat this hostility to the empty world as a resource for metaphysicians. They do not want to get involved in metaphysical disputes. They feel that logic should be neutral with respect to the existence of anything. They yearn to rectify this "defect in logical purity" (Russell 1919, 203)

The ideal of empirical neutrality has led some philosophers to reject classical logic. A direct response would be to be challenge the existential import of the classical quantifiers. Proponents of "free logic" prefer to challenge the existential presupposition of singular terms (Lambert 2003, 124). In classical logic, names must have referents. Free logic lacks this restriction and so countenances statements such as ‘Pegasus does not exist’.

These changes would have implications for Quine's (1953a) popular criterion for ontological commitment. Quine says that we can read off our metaphysics from the existentially quantified statements found in our well-accepted theories. For instance, if evolutionary theory says that there are some species that evolved from other species, and if we have no way to paraphrase away this claim, then biologists are committed to the existence of species. Since philosophers cannot improve on the credentials of a scientific commitment, metaphysicians would also be obliged to accept species.

So how does Quine defend his criterion of ontological commitment from the menace looming from the empty domain? By compromise. Normally one thinks of a logical theorem as a proposition that holds in all domains. Quine (1953b, 162) suggests that we weaken the requirement to that of holding in all non-empty domains. In the rare circumstances in which the empty universe must be considered, there is an easy way of testing which theorems will apply: count all the universal quantifications as true, and all the existential quantifications as false, and then compute for the remaining theorems.

Is Quine being ad hoc? Maybe. But exceptions are common for notions in the same family as the empty domain. For instance, instructors halt their students' natural pattern of thinking about division to forestall the disaster that accrues from permitting division by zero. If numbers were words, zero would be an irregular verb.

8. The problem of multiple nothings

Many of the arguments used to rule out total emptiness also preclude small pockets of emptiness. Leibniz says that the actual world must have something rather than nothing because the actual world must be the best of all possible worlds, and something is better than nothing. But by the same reasoning, Leibniz concludes there are no vacuums in the actual world: more is better than less.

Leibniz also has arguments that are directed against the possibility of there being more than one void. If there could be more than one void, then there could be two voids of exactly the same shape and size. These two voids would be perfect twins; everything true of one void would be true of the other. This is precluded by the principle of the identity of indiscernibles: if anything true of x is true of y, then x is identical to y.

A second problem with multiple voids arises from efforts to paraphrase them away. From the time of Melissus, there have been arguments against the possibility of a void existing in the manner that an object exists: "Nor is there any void, for void is nothing, and nothing cannot be." (Guthrie 1965, 104) If you say there is a vacuum in the flask, then you are affirming the existence of something in the flask — the vacuum. But since ‘vacuum’ means an absence of something, you are also denying that there is something in the flask. Therefore, ‘There is a vacuum in the flask’ is a contradiction.

Some react to Melissus's argument by analyzing vacuums as properties of things rather than things in their own right. According to C. J. F. Williams (1984, 383), ‘There is a vacuum in the flask’ should be rendered as ‘The flask noths’. He does this in the same spirit that he renders ‘There is fog in Winchester’ as ‘Winchester is foggy’ and ‘There is a smell in the basement’ as ‘The basement smells’.

If this paraphrase strategy works for vacuums, it ought to work for the more prosaic case of holes. Can a materialist believe that there are holes in his cheese? The holes are where the matter is not. So to admit the existence of holes is to admit the existence of immaterial objects. One response is to paraphrase ‘There is a hole in the cheese’ as ‘The cheese holes’ or, to be a bit easier on the ear, as ‘The cheese is perforated’. What appeared to be an existential claim is turned into a comment on the shape of the cheese.

But how are we to distinguish between the cheese having two holes as opposed to one? (Lewis and Lewis 1983, 4) Well, some cheese is singly perforated, some cheese is doubly-perforated, yet other cheese is n-perforated where n equals the number of holes in the cheese.

Whoa! We must be careful not to define ‘n-perforation’ in terms of holes; that would re-introduce the holes we set out to avoid. Some analysis is mandatory. If we leave expressions of the form ‘n-perforated’ as primitive, unanalyzed shaped predicates, we are stranded with an infinite list of primitive terms. Such a list could never have been memorized. Yet it is hard to see how ‘n-perforated’ can be recursively defined without alluding to holes.

The paraphrase prospects seem equally bleak for being ‘n-vacuumed’. Big meteorites pass through the atmosphere in about one second leaving a hole in the atmosphere — a vacuum in "thin air". The air cannot rush in quickly enough to fill the gap. This explains why rock vapor from the impact shoots back up into the atmosphere and later rains down widely on the surface. During a meteorite shower, the atmosphere is multiply vacuumed. But this is just to say that there are many vacuums in the atmosphere.

9. Is there any emptiness?

The trouble sustaining multiple voids may push us to the most extreme answer to ‘Why is there something rather than nothing?’, namely, ‘There must not only be something but there must not be any emptiness at all!’.

Parmenides maintained that it is self-defeating to say that something does not exist. The linguistic rendering of this insight is the problem of negative existentials: ‘Atlantis does not exist’ is about Atlantis. A statement can be about something only if that something exists. No relation without relata! Therefore, ‘Atlantis does not exist’ cannot be true. Parmenides and his disciples elaborated conceptual difficulties with negation into an incredible metaphysical monolith.

The Parmenideans were opposed by the atomists. The atomists said that the world is constituted by simple, indivisible things moving in empty space. They self-consciously endorsed the void to explain empirical phenomena such as movement, compression, and absorption.

Parmenides's disciple, Zeno of Elea, had already amassed an amazing battery of arguments to show motion is impossible. Since these imply that compression and absorption are also impossible, Zeno rejects the data of the atomists.

Less radical opponents of vacuums, such as Aristotle, re-explained the data within a framework of plenism: although the universe is full, objects can move because other objects get out of the way. Compression and absorption can be explained by having things pushed out of the way when other things jostle their way in.

Aristotle denied the void can explain why things move. Movement requires a mover that is pushing or pulling the object. An object in a vacuum is not in contact with anything else. If the object did move, there would be nothing to impede its motion. Therefore, any motion in a vacuum would be at an infinite speed.

Aristotle's refutation of the void persuaded most commentators for the next 1500 years. There were two limited dissenters to his thesis that vacuums are impossible. The Stoics agreed that terrestrial vacuums are impossible but believed there must be a void surrounding the cosmos. Hero of Alexandria agreed that there are no naturally occuring vacuums but believed that they can be formed artificially. He cites pumps and siphons as evidence that voids can be created. Hero believed that bodies have a natural horror of vacuums and struggle to prevent their formation. You can gauge the strength of the antipathy by trying to open a bellows that has had its air hole plugged. Try as you might, you cannot separate the sides. However, unlike Aristotle, Hero thought that if you and the bellows were tremendously strong, you could separate the sides and create a vacuum.

Hero's views became more popular after the Church's anti-Aristotelian condemnation of 1277 which required Christian scholars to allow for the possibility of a vacuum. The Medievals fiercely debated various recipes for creating vacuums.

Hero was eventually refuted by experiments with barometers conducted by Evangelista Torricelli and Blaise Pascal. Their barometer consisted of a tube partially submerged, upside down in bowl of mercury. What keeps the mercury suspended in the tube? Is there an unnatural vacuum that causes the surrounding glass to pull the liquid up? Or is there no vacuum at all but rather some rarefied and invisible matter in the "empty space"? Pascal answered that there really was nothing holding up the mercury. The mercury rises and falls due to variations in the weight of the atmosphere. The mercury is being pushed up the tube, not pulled up by anything.

When Pascal offered this explanation to Descartes, Descartes wrote Christian Huygens that Pascal had too much vacuum in his head. Descartes identified bodies with extension and so had no room for vacuums. If there were nothing between two objects, then they would be touching each other. And if they are touching each other, there is no gap between them.

Well maybe the apparent gap is merely a thinly occupied region of space. On this distributional model, there is no intermediate "empty object" that separates the two objects. There is merely unevenly spread matter. This model is very good at eliminating vacuums in the sense of empty objects. However, it is also rather good at eliminating ordinary objects. What we call objects would just be relatively thick deposits of matter. There would be only one natural object: the whole universe. This may have been the point of Spinoza's attack on vacuums (Bennett 1980).

Descartes was part of a tradition that denied action at a distance. Galileo was disappointed by Johannes Kepler's hypothesis that the moon influences the tides because the hypothesis seems to require causal chains in empty space. How could the great Kepler believe something so silly? When Isaac Newton resurrected Kepler's hypothesis he was careful to suggest that the space between the moon the Earth was filled with ether.

Indeed, the universality of Newton's law of gravitation seems to require that the whole universe be filled with a subtle substance. Hunger for ether grew as the wave-like features of light became established. A wave must have a medium.

Or must it? As the theoretical roles of the ether increased, physicists began to doubt there could be anything that accomplished such diverse feats. These doubts about the existence of ether were intensified by the emergence of Einstein's theory of relativity. He presented his theory as a relational account of space; if there were no objects, there would be no space. Space is merely a useful abstraction like your family tree. (There is controversy over whether Einstein's characterization of his relationism is accurate.)

Even those physicists who wished to retain substantival space broke with the atomist tradition of assigning virtually no properties to the void. They re-assign much of ether's responsibilities to space itself. Instead of having gravitational forces being propagated through the ether, they suggest that space is bent by mass. To explain how space can be finite and yet unbounded, they characterize space as spherical. When Edwin Hubble discovered that heavenly bodies are traveling away from each other (like sleepy flies resting on an expanding balloon), cosmologists were quick to suggest that space may be expanding. "Expanding into what?" wondered bewildered laymen. "How can space bend?" "How can space have a shape?"

Historians of science wonder whether the ether that was pushed out the front door of physics is returning through the back door under the guise of "space". Quantum field theory provides especially fertile area for such speculation. Particles are created with the help of energy present in "vacuums". To say that vacuums have energy and energy is convertible into mass, is to deny that vacuums are empty. Many physicists revel in the discovery that vacuums are far from empty.

Are these physicists using ‘vacuum’ in a new sense? If they are trying to correct laymen, then they need to couch their surprises in sentences using the ordinary sense of ‘vacuum’. Laymen are generally willing to defer to scientists when they are characterizing natural kinds. But vacuums do not seem like natural kinds because they do not seem to be substances — or anything at all. Plato introduced the notion of a natural kind with an analogy featuring a butcher cutting an animal at it joints. There do not appear to be natural boundaries between voids and objects.

10. Existential aspects of nothingness

After a mystical experience in 1654, Blaise Pascal's interest in nothingness passed from its significance to science to its significance to the human condition. Pascal thinks human beings have a unique perspective on their finitude. His Pensees is a roller coaster ride surveying the human lot. Pascal elevates us to the level of angels by exalting in our grasp of the infinite, and then runs us down below the beasts for wittingly choosing evil over goodness. Pascal takes us up again by marveling at how human beings tower over the microscopic kingdom, and then plunges us down toward insignificance by having us dwell on the vastness of space, and immensity of the eternity.

He who regards himself in this light will be afraid of himself, and observing himself sustained in the body given him by nature between those two abysses of the Infinite and Nothing, will tremble at the sight of these marvels; and I think that, as his curiosity changes into admiration, he will be more disposed to contemplate them in silence than to examine them with presumption.

For in fact what is man in nature? A Nothing in comparison with the Infinite, an All in comparison with the Nothing, a mean between nothing and everything. Since he is infinitely removed from comprehending the extremes, the end of things and their beginning are hopelessly hidden from him in an impenetrable secret; he is equally incapable of seeing the Nothing from which he was made, and the Infinite in which he is swallowed up. (Pensees sect. II, 72)

Pascal's association of nothingness with insignificance and meaninglessness presages themes popularized by existentialists in the twentieth century.

In The Concept of Dread, Soren Kierkegaard claims that nothingness wells up into our awareness through moods and emotions. Emotions are intentional states; they are directed toward something. If angered, I am angry at something. If amused, there is something I find amusing. Free floating anxiety is often cited as a counterexample. But Kierkegaard says that in this case the emotion is directed at nothingness.

According to Heidegger, we have several motives to shy away from the significance of our emotional encounters with nothingness. They are premonitions of the nothingness of death. They echo the groundlessness of human existence.

Some have hoped that our recognition of our rootlessness would rescue meaningfulness from the chaos of nothing. But Heidegger denies us such solace.

Heidegger does think freedom is rooted in nothingness. He also says we derive our concept of logical negation from this experience of nothing. Since Heidegger does not think that dogs have such experiences, he is committed to skepticism about animal reasoning involving negation. Consider the Stoic example of a dog that is following a trail. The dog reaches a fork in the road, sniffs at one road and then, without a further sniff, proceeds down the only remaining road. The Stoics took this as evidence that the dog has performed a disjunctive syllogism: "Either my quarry went down this road or that road. Sniff — he did not go down that road. Therefore, he went down this road." Heidegger must discount this as anthropomorphism.

Many biologists and psychologists side with the Stoic's emphasis on our continuity with animals. They deny that human beings have a monopoly on nothingness. A classic anomaly for the stimulus-response behaviorist was the laboratory rat that responds to the absence of a stimulus:

One rather puzzling class of situations which elicit fear are those which consist of a lack of stimulation. Some members of this class may be special instances of novelty. An anesthetised chimpanzee could be described as a normal chimpanzee with the added novelty of ‘no movement’; solitude could be the novelty of ‘no companions’. This is not simply quibbling with words; for there is very good evidence (see Chapter 13) that the failure of a stimulus to occur at a point in time or space where it usually occurs acts like any other kind of novel stimulus. However, the intensity of the fear evoked by the sight of a dead or mutilated body is so much greater than that evoked by more ordinary forms of novelty that we perhaps ought to seek an alternative explanation of the effects of this stimulus. Fear of the dark is also difficult to account for in terms of novelty, since by the time this fear matures darkness is no less familiar than the light. (Gray 1987, 22)

Existentialists tend to be jilted rationalists. They inherit the reason-worshipper's tendency to over-intellectualize emotions. A correct explanation of emotional engagement with absences must be more general and cognitively less demanding than existentialists tend to presuppose.

Existentialists differ from the rationalists in their almost masochistic appreciation of paradox. These connoisseurs of irony do not withdraw reflexively from the pain of contradiction. They introspect upon the inconsistency in the hope of achieving a resolution that does justice to the three dimensionality of deep philosophical problems. For instance, Heidegger is sensitive to the hazards of saying that nothing exists. That is why he contorts ordinary language and instead says "The nothing nihilates" (Das Nichts selbst nichtet). This does not fit on the blackboard of logic. Accordingly, Rudolph Carnap made Heidegger's remark famous by exhibiting it as a paradigm of metaphysical nonsense.

Other critics deny that Being and Time suffers from an absence of meaning. Just the reverse: they think Heidegger's passages about nothing involve too many meanings. When Heidegger connects negation with nothingness and death, these logicians are put in mind of an epitaph that toys with the principle of excluded middle: Mrs Nott was Nott Alive and is Nott Dead. According to these critics, Being and Time can only be understood in the way we understand the solution to equivocal riddles:

What does a man love more than life?
Hate more than death or mortal strife?
That which contented men desire,
The poor have, the rich require,
The miser spends, the spendthrift saves,
And all men carry to their graves?

(Leemings, 1953, 201)

The answer, Nothing, can only be seen through a kaleidoscope of equivocations.

Heidegger gives no intelligible answer to ‘Why is there something rather than nothing?’. In many turgid passages of Being and Time, Heidegger appears to be sinking deeper with each step "forward". Logicians try to haul Heidegger out of the quicksand. They distinguish the quantifier ‘no’ from the logical operation of negation. The logicians prise apart senses of ‘is’ and clear up confusions about identity. They carefully compare and contrast ‘exist’ and ordinary predicates. Gradually looking more like philosophers, they pass to more elusive characters such as non-being, negative facts, and so on.

The professionalism of the first few steps in this rescue operation inspire confidence and optimism. Thanks to the remarkable advances in logic during the twentieth century, the rescue party enjoys an impressive grasp of quantifiers, variables, truth-tables, etc. But as they slog deeper toward Heidegger and their white coats get muddy, it becomes increasingly evident that the rescuers are themselves in need of rescue.

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abstract objects | condemnation of 1277 | existence | existentialism | holes | Japanese Philosophy: Kyoto School | nonexistent objects | Zeno of Elea: Zeno's paradoxes