Notes to Method and Metaphysics in Plato's Sophist and Statesman

1. On the Sophistic movement itself, which owes its negative assessment largely to Plato, see Kerferd, 1981; Barney, 2006; and with special reference to Plato’s Sophist, Notomi, 1999, ch. 2.

2. Omitted here is a survey of the constructive puzzles about not-being—though § 6.1 below mentions the main error about negation that must be corrected. Also omitted are all the puzzles about being. Most important is the Battle of Gods and Giants. The gods are friends of the forms, who look like middle period Platonists; the giants are materialists (245e-249d). The Stranger offers the reformed materialists a criterion (horos) of being as a capacity (dunamis) to do something to something else or to experience something by something else (247d-e). On the Battle of Gods and Giants, see Owen, 1966, and Brown, 1998.

3. The myth has been much debated but will not be discussed in this essay. For some interpretations, see Rowe, 1995, Ferrari, 1995, and Lane, 1998, Part II.