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Platonism in Metaphysics

First published Wed 12 May, 2004

Platonism is the view that there exist such things as abstract objects — where an abstract object is an object that is wholly non-spatial and non-temporal (i.e., that doesn't exist in space or time) and, hence, is entirely non-physical and non-mental. This might be a bit obscure, but in what follows, we will go into much more detail on this and see precisely what the platonist view amounts to. Before we do this, however, it should be noted that the view we will be discussing is a contemporary view. Now, there is no question that this view owes a great deal to the writings of Plato — that, of course, is why it's called ‘platonism’ — but it is not entirely clear that Plato actually endorsed this view, and it is for this reason that the term ‘platonism’ is spelled with a lower-case ‘p’. It may be that Plato endorsed platonism, and indeed, it can probably be said that this is the standard view among Plato scholars, but the question is still controversial. (See entry on Plato.)

The most important figure in the development of the contemporary platonist view is, by far, Frege (1884, 1892, 1893-1903, 1919). But the view has also been endorsed by many others, including some very important figures, such as Gödel (1964) and, at some stages in their careers, Russell (1912) and Quine (1948, 1951).

Section 1 will describe the contemporary platonist view in detail. Section 2 will describe the alternatives to platonism — namely, conceptualism (or as it's also called, psychologism), nominalism, immanent realism (or physicalism), and Meinongianism. Section 3 will develop and assess what, historically, has been the most important argument in favor of platonism, namely, the One Over Many argument. Section 4 will develop and critique a second argument for platonism, namely, the Singular Term argument; this argument emerged much later than the One Over Many argument, but as we will see, it is widely thought to be more powerful. Finally, section 5 will develop and critique the most important argument against platonism, namely, the epistemological argument.

1. What is Platonism?

Platonism is the view that there exist abstract objects, and again, an object is abstract just in case it is non-spatiotemporal, i.e., does not exist in space or time. Because abstract objects are wholly non-spatiotemporal, it follows that they are also entirely non-physical (they do not exist in the physical world and aren't made of physical stuff) and non-mental (they aren't minds and aren't ideas in minds, or brains, or disembodied souls, or Gods, or anything else along these lines). In addition, they are unchanging and entirely causally inert — that is, they cannot be involved in cause-and-effect relationships with other objects.[1] All of this might be somewhat perplexing; for with all of these statements about what abstract objects are not, it might be unclear what they are. We can clarify things, however, by looking at some examples.

Three examples of things that are often taken to be abstract are (a) mathematical objects (most notably, numbers), (b) properties, and (c) propositions. To see what platonists think a number is, consider the sentence ‘3 is prime’. Prima facie, this sentence seems to say something about a particular object, namely, the number 3. Just as the sentence ‘The moon is round’ says something about the moon, so too ‘3 is prime’ seems to say something about the number 3. But what is the number 3? There are a few different views that one might endorse here, but the platonist view is that 3 is an abstract object. On this view, 3 is a real and objective thing that, like the moon, exists independently of us and our thinking (i.e., it isn't just an idea in our heads). But according to platonism, 3 is different from the moon in that it is not a physical object; it is wholly non-physical, non-mental, and causally inert, existing outside of space and time. One might put this metaphorically by saying that on the platonist view, “numbers exist in platonic heaven”. But we should not infer from this that according to platonism, numbers exist in a place; they don't, for the concept of a place is a physical, spatial concept. It is more accurate to say that on the platonist view, numbers exist (really and objectively and independently of us and our thoughts) but do not exist in space and time.

Similarly, there are many people who take a platonistic view of properties. Consider, for instance, the property of being red. According to the standard platonist view of properties, the property of redness exists independently of any red thing. There are red balls and red houses and red shirts, and these all exist in the physical world. But platonists (about properties) believe that in addition to these things, there also exists redness — the property itself — and according to platonists, this property is an abstract object; that is, it is a real and objective thing that exists independently of any thinking creature, outside of space and time. Ordinary red objects are said to exemplify or instantiate redness. Plato said that they participate in redness, but this is suggestive of a causal relationship between red objects and redness, and again, contemporary platonists would reject this.

Of course, platonists of this sort say the same thing about other properties as well: in addition to all the beautiful things, there is also beauty; and in addition to all the tigers, there is also the property of being a tiger. Indeed, even when there doesn't exist anything that instantiates a certain property, platonists maintain that the property itself still exists; thus, for instance, according to this sort of platonism, there exists a property of being a four-hundred-story building, even though there are no such things as four-hundred-story buildings. This property exists outside of space and time along with redness. The only difference is that in our physical world, the one property happens to be instantiated whereas the other does not.

In fact, platonists extend the position here even further, for on their view, properties are just a special case of a much broader category of abstract object, namely, the category of universals. It's easy to see why one might think of a property like redness as a universal. A red ball that sits in a garage in Buffalo is a particular thing. But redness is something that is exemplified by many, many objects; it's something that all red objects share, or have in common. This is why platonists think of redness as a universal and of specific red objects — such as balls in Buffalo, or cars in Cleveland — as particulars.

But according to this sort of platonism, properties are not the only universals; there are other kinds of universals as well, most notably, relations. Consider, for instance, the relation to the north of; this relation is instantiated by many pairs of objects (or more accurately, by ordered pairs of objects, since order matters here — e.g., to the north of is instantiated by <San Francisco, Los Angeles>, and <Edinburgh, London>, but not by <Los Angeles, San Francisco>, or <London, Edinburgh>). So according to platonism, the relation to the north of is a two-place universal, as opposed to a property, which is a one-place universal. The difference is that whereas properties are instantiated by single objects, relations like to the north of are instantiated by (ordered) pairs of objects. There are also three-place relations (which are three-place universals), four-place relations (which are four-place universals), and so on. (An example of a three-place relation is the gave relation, which admits of a giver, a givee, and a given — as in ‘Jane gave a CD to Tim’.)

Finally, some people claim that propositions are abstract objects. Intuitively, a proposition is the meaning of a sentence, or as some would rather put it, that which is expressed by a sentence on a particular occasion of use. Thus, for instance, we can say that the English sentence ‘Snow is white’ and the German sentence ‘Schnee ist weiss’ express the same proposition, namely, the proposition that snow is white. There are a few different mainstream conceptions of propositions. On one view, propositions are inherently compositional objects; that is, they have components (or constituents, or parts) that they are composed out of. There are two main versions of the compositional view of propositions. According to one version — due mainly to Frege (1892, 1919), but developed also by the early Kaplan (1968-69), Evans (1981), Peacocke (1981), Katz (1986), Forbes (1987), and Balaguer (forthcoming) — the components, or parts, of propositions are the meanings (or senses) of the words inside the sentences that express the propositions. For instance, the proposition that snow is white has, as a component, the meaning of the expression ‘is white’. Thus, the proposition that snow is white has a part in common with the proposition that milk is white; one and the same meaning, or sense, is a part of both propositions. (It is often held that meanings of this sort are concepts; e.g., on this view, the meaning of ‘is white’ is just the concept white. It should be noted, however, that (a) Frege himself used the word ‘concept’ differently, and (b) concepts of this sort (i.e., meanings, or senses) are, on the present view, abstract objects, not mental objects.)

The second version of the compositional view has roots in the work of Mill (1843), and it can be traced through the writings of Russell (1905, 1910-11), Strawson (1950), Donnellan (1966), Kripke (1972), the later Kaplan (1989), Salmon (1986), Soames (1987), and Braun (1998). On this view, the components of propositions are properties, relations, and ordinary objects. For instance, consider the sentence ‘Muhammad Ali is famous’. According to the present view, the proposition expressed by this sentence is composed of Muhammad Ali — the actual man — and the property of being famous. Propositions like this, that contain actual objects as components, are called singular propositions; and the view that singular propositions are what are expressed by sentences of the above kind — most notably, sentences containing proper names — is called direct reference theory, or alternatively, Millianism or Russellianism. The opposing view — that is, Fregeanism — holds that names like ‘Muhammad Ali’ have meanings, or senses, and that these are what names contribute to propositions. Thus, for Frege, the sentences ‘Muhammad Ali is famous’ and ‘Cassius Clay is famous’ express different propositions, whereas according to direct reference theory, they express the same proposition (because Muhammad Ali is Cassius Clay).[2] A related point here is that advocates of the direct reference theory will usually deny that propositions are meanings; on most versions of this view, a sentence meaning is something like a rule for how to use a sentence, whereas a proposition is that which is expressed by a sentence on a particular occasion of use. So for instance, the sentence ‘He is tall’ has a single, unique meaning, but in different contexts, it can express different propositions, because ‘he’ can refer in one context to Wilt Chamberlain and in another context to Shaquille O'Neal, or Danny DeVito, or anybody.

Finally, there are also views that deny that propositions are compositional entities at all. For instance, one view here is that a proposition is a set of possible worlds. (Possible worlds are also objects that some people have taken to be abstract; we will discuss these objects in section 4.5.)

For present purposes, the differences between the various views of propositions will not be very important, because the standard versions of all of the mainstream views take propositions to be abstract objects. Thus, for instance, it is important to distinguish propositions, as the platonist conceives them, from ideas in our heads. There are some views that hold that when I think the thought that snow is white, there is an entity in my head that somehow encodes, or represents, the idea that snow is white; but this mental/physical entity is different from the proposition itself, as platonists conceive it. The proposition, according to platonists of this kind, is an abstract object; it exists outside of space and time, and it is wholly non-physical and non-mental. (For more on these issues, see entries on Propositions and Reference.)

Numbers, propositions, and universals (i.e., properties and relations), are not the only things that people have taken to be abstract objects. As we will see below, people have also endorsed platonistic views in connection with linguistic objects (most notably, sentences), possible worlds, logical objects, and fictional characters (e.g., Sherlock Holmes). And it is important to note here that one can be a platonist about some of these things without being a platonist about the others — e.g., one might be a platonist about numbers and propositions but not properties or fictional characters.

Of course, platonism about any of these kinds of objects is very controversial. There are a lot of philosophers who don't believe in abstract objects at all and who take different views of things like numbers and properties; for instance, one might say that such objects are ideas in our heads, or that they are purely physical things. The alternatives to platonism will be discussed in section 2, but it is worth noting here that the primary argument that platonists give for their view is that, according to them, there are good arguments against all other views. That is, platonists think we have to believe in abstract objects, because (a) there are good reasons for thinking that we have to admit the existence of things like numbers and universals, and (b) the only tenable view of these things is that they are abstract objects. We will consider these arguments in detail below.

2. A Taxonomy of Positions

There are not very many alternatives to platonism. One can endorse an anti-realist view and reject the existence of things like numbers and universals altogether. Or one can maintain that there do exist such things as numbers and universals, and instead of saying that they are abstract objects, one can say that they are concrete mental objects of some sort (usually, the claim is that they are something like ideas in our heads) or concrete physical objects of some sort. Since it seems that all objects are either physical, mental, or abstract, it seems that these are the only options.[3] Thus, the four mainstream views here are as follows (and keep in mind that anti-platonists can pursue different strategies with respect to different kinds of alleged abstract objects; thus, for instance, one might hold that properties are physical things and numbers are mental things, and so each of the views discussed below should be thought of as having as many different versions as there are kinds of alleged abstract objects).

  1. Platonism (also called transcendent realism and ante rem realism): This is the view described in section 1.

  2. Immanent Realism (also called in re realism): Advocates of this view agree with platonists that there do exist such things as mathematical objects — or universals, or whatever category of alleged abstract objects we're talking about — and that these things are independent of us and our thinking; but immanent realists differ from platonists in holding that these objects exist in the physical world. Depending on the kind of object under discussion — i.e., whether we're talking about mathematical objects or properties or what have you — the details of this view will be worked out differently. In connection with properties, the standard immanent-realist view is that there is such a thing as redness but that it exists only in the physical world, in particular, in actual red things, as nonspatial parts or aspects of those things (this view traces back to Aristotle; in contemporary times, it has been defended by Armstrong (1978)). There is certainly some initial plausibility to this idea: if you are looking at a red ball, and you think that in addition to the ball, its redness exists, then it seems a bit odd to say (as platonists do) that its redness exists outside of spacetime. After all, the ball is sitting right here in spacetime and we can see that it's red; so it seems initially plausible to think that if the redness exists at all, then it exists in the ball. Plausible as this may sound at the start, however, we will see below that there are serious problems with this view.

    In connection with numbers, one strategy is to take numbers to be universals of some sort — e.g., one might take them to be properties of piles of physical objects, so that, for instance, the number 3 would be a property of, e.g., a pile of three books — and to take an immanent realist view of universals. (This sort of view has been defended by Armstrong (1978).) Another strategy for taking number talk to be about the physical world is to take it to be about actual piles of physical objects, rather than properties of piles. Thus, for instance, one might maintain that to say that 2 + 3 = 5 is not really to say something about specific entities (numbers); rather, it is to say that whenever we push a pile of two objects together with a pile of three objects, we will wind up with a pile of five objects — or something along these lines. Thus, on this view, arithmetic is just a very general natural science. A view of this sort was developed by Mill (1843) and, more recently, a similar view has been defended by Philip Kitcher (1984). It should be noted, however, that while there are certainly physicalist themes running through the views of Mill and Kitcher, it is not clear that either of them should be interpreted as an immanent realist. Kitcher is probably best classified as a kind of anti-realist (I'll say a bit more about this in section 4.1), and it's not entirely clear how Mill ought to be classified, relative to our taxonomy, because it's not clear how he would answer the question, “Are there numbers, and if so, what are they?”

    Finally, Penelope Maddy (or rather the early Maddy (1990), for she has since altered her stance (1997)) has also developed a sort of immanent realist view of mathematics. Concentrating mainly on set theory, Maddy maintains that sets of physical objects are located in space and time, right where their members are located. But Maddian sets cannot be identified with the physical matter that constitutes their members. On Maddy's view, corresponding to every physical object, there is a huge infinity of sets (e.g., the set containing the given object, the set containing that set, and so on) that are all distinct from one another but that all share the same matter and the same spatiotemporal location; thus, on this view, there is more to a set than the physical stuff that makes up its members, and despite the fact that these Maddian sets exist in space and time, there is still something non-physical about them, in some sense of this term.

  3. Conceptualism (also called psychologism and mentalism, depending on the sorts of objects under discussion): This is the view that there do exist numbers — or universals, or whatever category of alleged abstract objects we're talking about — but that they do not exist independently of us; instead, they are mental objects; in particular, the claim is usually that they are something like ideas in our heads. As we will see below, this view has serious problems and not very many people endorse it. Nonetheless, it has had periods of popularity in the history of philosophy: it is very often thought that Locke held a conceptualistic view of universals, and prior to the twentieth century, this was the standard view of concepts and propositions; in the philosophy of mathematics, psychologistic views were popular in the late nineteenth century (the most notable proponent being the early Husserl (1891)) and even in the first part of the twentieth century with the advent of psychologistic intuitionism (Brouwer 1912 and 1948, and Heyting 1956); and finally, Noam Chomsky (1965) has endorsed a mentalistic view of sentences, and he has been followed here by others, most notably, Fodor (1975, 1987).

  4. Nominalism (also called anti-realism): This is the view that there are no such things as numbers, or universals, or whatever sort of alleged abstract objects are under discussion. Thus, for instance, a nominalist about properties would say that while there are such things as red balls and red houses, there is no such thing as the property of redness, over and above the red balls and red houses. And a nominalist about numbers would say that while there are such things as piles of three stones, and perhaps “3-ideas” existing in people's heads, there is no such thing as the number 3. As we will see below, there are many different versions of each of these kinds of nominalism, but for now, we don't need anything more than this general formulation of the view. (Sometimes ‘nominalism’ is used to denote the view that there are no such things as abstract objects; on this usage, ‘nominalism’ is synonymous with ‘anti-platonism’, and views like immanent realism count as versions of nominalism. In contrast, on the usage employed in this essay, ‘nominalism’ is essentially synonymous with ‘anti-realism’, and so views like immanent realism will not count as versions of nominalism here.)

Prima facie, it might seem that nominalism, or anti-realism, is further from the platonist view than immanent realism and conceptualism are, for the simple reason that the latter two views admit that there do exist such things as numbers (or universals, or whatever). It is important to note, however, that nominalists agree with platonists on an important point that immanent realists and conceptualists reject; in particular, nominalists (in agreement with platonists) endorse the following thesis:

(S) If there were such things as numbers (or universals, or whatever sort of alleged abstract objects we're talking about), then they would be abstract objects; that is, they would be non-spatiotemporal, non-physical, and non-mental.

This is an extremely important point, because it turns out that there are some very compelling arguments (which we will discuss) in favor of (S) and that, today, this thesis is widely accepted. As a result, there are very few advocates of immanent realism and conceptualism; the two most popular views, by far, are platonism and nominalism. There is wide-spread agreement about what numbers, propositions, and universals would be if there were such things (namely, abstract objects), but very little agreement as to whether there do exist such things. Thus, today, the controversial question here is a purely ontological one: Are there any such things as abstract objects (e.g., mathematical objects, universals, propositions, and so on)?

Before going on, it is worth noting that while there are only four mainstream views here (viz., platonism, immanent realism, conceptualism, and nominalism) there is a fifth view that deserves mention, namely, Meinongianism. On this view, every singular term — e.g., ‘Clinton’, ‘3’, and ‘Sherlock Holmes’ — picks out an object that has some sort of being (that subsists, or that is, in some sense) but only some of these objects have full-blown existence. According to Meinongianism, sentences that platonists take to be about abstract objects — sentences like ‘3 is prime’ and ‘Red is a color’ — express truths about objects that don't exist.

Meinongianism has been almost universally rejected by philosophers. The standard argument against it is that it does not provide a view that is clearly distinct from platonism and merely creates the illusion of a different view by altering the meaning of the term ‘exist’. The idea here is that on the standard meaning of ‘exist’, any object that has any being at all exists, and so according to standard usage, Meinongianism entails that numbers and universals exist; but this view clearly doesn't take such things to exist in spacetime and so, the argument concludes, Meinongianism entails that numbers and universals are abstract objects — just as platonism holds. Quine put this argument in the following way (1948, p. 3):

Wyman,[4] by the way, is one of those philosophers who have united in ruining the good old word ‘exist’…[He limits the application conditions of] the word ‘existence’…thus, preserving an illusion of ontological agreement between himself and us who repudiate the rest of his bloated universe. We have all been prone to say, in our common-sense usage of ‘exist’, that Pegasus does not exist, meaning simply that there is no such entity at all. If Pegasus existed he would indeed be in space and time, but only because the word ‘Pegasus’ has spatio-temporal connotations, and not because ‘exists’ has spatio-temporal connotations. If spatio-temporal reference is lacking when we affirm the existence of the cube root of 27, this is simply because a cube root is not a spatio-temporal kind of thing, and not because we are being ambiguous in our use of ‘exist’. However, Wyman, in an ill-conceived effort to appear agreeable, genially grants us the nonexistence of Pegasus and then, contrary to what we meant by nonexistence of Pegasus, insists that Pegasus is. Existence is one thing, he says, and subsistence is another. The only way I know of coping with this obfuscation of issues is to give Wyman the word ‘exist’. I'll try not to use it again; I still have ‘is’. So much for lexicography; let's get back to Wyman's ontology.

So today, it is widely thought that Meinongianism does not provide a genuine alternative to the four views sketched above. It is worth noting, however, that Richard Routley (or Sylvan, as he later became known) defended a second version of Meinongianism, one that holds that (a) things like numbers and universals don't exist at all (i.e., have no sort of being whatsoever), but (b) we can still say true things about them — e.g., we can say (truly) that 3 is prime, even though it doesn't exist (see Routley (1980) and Priest (2003), and for similar views, see Azzouni (1994) and Salmon (1998), although these latter two philosophers would not use the term ‘Meinongianism’ in describing their views). One problem with this second version of Meinongianism is as follows: just as Meinongians of the first sort seem to alter the meaning of ‘exist’, so Meinongians of the second sort seem to alter the meaning of ‘true’. Most people would say that if there is no such thing as the object a, then sentences of the form ‘a is F’ cannot be literally true (I follow the standard convention here of using lower-case letters (e.g., ‘a’) to symbolize expressions like names that purport to denote specific objects (e.g., ‘Mars’) and upper-case letters (e.g., ‘F’) to symbolize predicates (e.g., ‘is red’), which express properties). Or equivalently, it is a widely accepted principle that if you think that the sentence ‘a is F’ is literally true, then you are committed to believing in the existence of the object a. This principle is called a criterion of ontological commitment, and it will be discussed at length in section 3. For now, though, we can simply note that because this principle is widely accepted, views of the above sort — i.e., views along the lines of the second version of Meinongianism — do not have many supporters. (David Lewis (1990) has also argued against Routley's view, and his arguments are similar in certain ways to the standard Quinean arguments against the original version of Meinongianism.)

3. The One Over Many Argument

How have platonists gone about arguing that their view is superior to the other views we have defined here? Well, there are two mainstream argument strategies. The first, which goes back to Plato, is an argument for the existence of properties only; this is the One Over Many argument. The second is also present in some sense in the works of Plato (at least on some readings of those works), but its first really clear formulation was given by Frege (1884, 1892, 1893-1903, 1919); I will call this the singular term argument, and unlike the One Over Many, it can be used in connection with all of the different kinds of abstract objects, e.g., numbers, properties, propositions, and so on. In the present section, we will discuss the One Over Many, and in the next section, we will discuss the singular term argument.

The One Over Many argument can be formulated as follows: if I have in front of me three red objects (say a ball, a hat, and a rose), then it seems that these objects have something in common; what they have in common is clearly a property, namely, redness; therefore, redness exists. We can think of this argument as an inference to the best explanation. There is a fact here that requires explanation, namely, that the three objects resemble each other; and the explanation is that they all possess a single property, namely, redness. Thus, platonists argue, if there is no other explanation of this fact (i.e., the fact of resemblance) that is as good as their explanation (i.e., the one that appeals to properties), then we are justified in believing in properties.

Notice that as the argument has been stated here, it is not an argument for a platonistic view of properties; it is an argument for the thesis that properties exist, but not for the thesis that properties are abstract objects. Thus, in order to use this argument to motivate platonism, one would have to supplement it with some reason for thinking that the properties in question here could not be ideas in our heads or immanent properties existing in particular physical objects. There are a number of arguments that one might use here, and in section 4.3, we will discuss some of these. But there is no need to pursue this here, because there is good reason to think that the One Over Many argument doesn't succeed anyway — i.e., that it doesn't provide a good reason for believing in properties at all, regardless of what nature they have. In other words, we are going to see that (on the standard view) the One Over Many argument fails to refute nominalism about properties.

Before discussing how nominalists can respond to the One Over Many argument, it is worth pointing out that the traditional version of the One Over Many described above can be simplified a bit. As has been pointed out by Michael Devitt (1980), the appeal to resemblance, or to multiple things having a given property, is a bit of red herring. On the traditional formulation of the argument, nominalists are challenged to account for the following fact: the ball is red and the hat is red. But if nominalists can account for the fact that the ball is red, then presumably, they can simply repeat the same sort of explanation in connection with the hat, and they will have accounted for the fact that both things are red. Thus, what nominalists really need to account for here are, very simply, predicative facts, e.g., the fact that the ball is red; and of course, nominalists have to account for this fact without appealing to the property of redness. More generally, they need to show how we can account for the truth of sentences of the form ‘a is F’ without appealing to a property of Fness.[5]

There is a very well-known nominalist response to the One Over Many argument. The heart of the response is captured by the following remark from Quine (1948, p. 10):

That the houses and roses and sunsets are all of them red may be taken as ultimate and irreducible, and it may be held that McX[6] is no better off, in point of real explanatory power, for all the occult entities which he posits under such names as ‘redness’.

There are two different ideas here; the first idea is that nominalists can respond to the One Over Many with an appeal to ultimate or irreducible facts (or as they're also called, brute facts), and the second idea is that platonists are no better off than such brute-fact nominalists in terms of real explanatory power. Now, Quine didn't say very much about these two ideas, and it's not entirely clear how exactly he would have developed the view here, but a version of this view has been developed in much more detail by Devitt (1980). (Devitt's presentation of the view is clearly based on Quinean ideas, and so I will refer to it as Quinean nominalism, but it should be noted that the view goes beyond what Quine actually said.)

Let's begin our presentation of the nominalist view here by returning to our formulation of the One Over Many argument. The challenge to nominalists, recall, is to provide an explanation for facts of a certain kind, namely, predicative facts, i.e., facts that can be accurately described by sentences of the form ‘a is F’, e.g., the fact that a given ball is red. Now, whenever we are challenged to provide an explanation for a fact, or alleged fact, there are a number of strategies that we can pursue in trying to respond to the challenge. Of course, the most obvious thing we can do is simply provide the requested explanation. But this isn't the only way to respond to a demand for an explanation. Another way to respond is to argue that the alleged fact requiring explanation isn't really a fact at all. And a third way to respond is to argue that the fact in question is a brute fact — i.e., that while it is indeed a fact, it does not have an explanation. In other words, we can say that it is a bottom-level fact, or to use Quine's terminology, an ultimate or irreducible fact. Now, in the present case, nominalists can't very well claim that all predicative facts are brute facts, because it is clear that we can explain at least some facts of this sort; our success in empirical science is evidence of this. For instance, it seems that the fact that a given ball is red can be explained very easily by saying that it is red because it reflects light in such and such a way, and that it reflects light in this way because its surface is structured in thus and so a manner. So, obviously, nominalists should not claim that all predicative facts are brute facts. But as Devitt points out, there is a more subtle way to appeal to bruteness here, and if Quinean nominalists make use of this, they can block the One Over Many argument.

The Quine-Devitt response to the One Over Many begins with the claim that we can account for the fact that the ball is red, without appealing to the property of redness, by simply using whatever explanation scientists give for this fact. Now, by itself, this explanation will not satisfy advocates of the One Over Many, because from the point of view of that argument, this explanation will invoke more properties; for instance, if we explain the fact that the ball is red by pointing out that its surface is structured in some specific way, then advocates of the One Over Many argument will say that by providing this explanation, we have only moved the problem back a step, because nominalists will now have to account for the fact that the ball's surface is structured in the given way, and they will have to do this without appealing to the property of being structured in the given way. More generally, the point is this: it is of course true that if nominalists are asked to account for the fact that some object a is F, without appealing to the property of Fness, they can do this by pointing out that (i) a is G and (ii) all Fs are Gs (this is the sort of explanation they will get, if they borrow their explanations from scientists); but no such explanation will solve the problem that the One Over Many raises; such explanations only move that problem back a step, for they leave us with the task of having to explain the fact that a is G, and if we want to endorse nominalism, we will have to do this without appealing to the property of Gness.

This is where the appeal to bruteness comes in. What nominalists can say here is that (a) we can keep giving explanations of the above sort (i.e., explanations of the sort ‘a is F because it is G,’ or because its parts are Gs, Hs, and Is, or whatever) for as long as we can, and (b) when explanations of this sort cannot be given, no explanation at all can be given. The thought here is that at this point, we will have arrived at fundamental facts for which it is very plausible to suppose that they really don't have explanations and, hence, really are brute — e.g., facts about the basic physical natures of elementary physical particles. When we arrive at facts like this, we will say: “There's no reason why these particles are this way; they just are.”

This gives us a way of understanding how nominalists can plausibly use an appeal to bruteness to respond to the One Over Many argument. But the appeal to bruteness is only half of the Quinean remark quoted above. What about the other half, i.e., the part about McX being no better off than brute-fact nominalists in terms of real explanatory power? To appreciate this claim, let us suppose that we have arrived at a bottom-level fact that Quinean nominalists (i.e., brute-fact nominalists of the sort described above) take to be a brute fact (e.g., the fact that physical particles of some particular kind — say, gluons — are G), and let us ask what advocates of the One Over Many would say about such a fact. Presumably, their stance is going to be that their view is superior to Quinean nominalism because they can provide an explanation of the fact in question. Now, when they announce this, people who were interested in the question of why gluons are G (and who had been disappointed to hear from scientists and Quineans that this is simply a brute fact) might get very excited and listen eagerly to what advocates of the One Over Many have to say. What they say is this:

Gluons are G because they possess the property of Gness.

This doesn't seem very helpful. The claim that gluons possess Gness seems to do little more than tell us that gluons have some nature that makes it the case that they are G; this seems wholly uninformative, and so it seems that no genuine explanation has been given here. After all, those who had been interested in learning why gluons are G would not be very satisfied by this so-called “explanation”. Thus, to use Quine's words, it seems that advocates of the One Over Many are “no better off, in point of real explanatory power” than brute-fact nominalists are.

Nominalists might try to push the argument a bit further here, claiming that the sentence

(P) Gluons possesses the property of Gness

is just a paraphrase of the sentence

(N) Gluons are G.

On this view, (P) is equivalent to (N). That is, it says the very same thing. We can call this a paraphrase-nominalist view of sentences like (P). But nominalists needn't endorse this view. They can also endorse a fictionalist view of sentences like (P). On this view, (P) and (N) do not, strictly speaking, say the same thing, because (P) talks about the property of Gness and (N) does not; thus, according to this fictionalist view, (P) is strictly speaking untrue, because it talks about the property of Gness, and according to nominalism, there is no such thing as Gness (because there are no such things as properties). In short, (P) is strictly speaking untrue, on this view, for the same reason that, e.g., ‘The tooth fairy is nice’ is untrue. But according to fictionalism, (P) is a useful fiction, because in ordinary language, we can use it to express a truth (namely, the truth that gluons are G); in other words, the sentence (P) is not literally true on this view, but it is “for all practical purposes true”, or some such thing, because colloquially, it can be used to say what (N) says literally. This idea is often captured by saying that (P) is just a manner of speaking, or a façon de parler. (Notice that the dispute between fictionalism and paraphrase nominalism is best understood as a straightforward empirical dispute about the ordinary-language semantics of sentences like (P); the question is whether such sentences literally say the same things that the corresponding sentences like (N) say.)

Whichever view nominalists adopt here, they can respond to the One Over Many argument — i.e., to the claim that we can explain (N) by endorsing (P) — in the same way, namely, by pointing out that as an explanation of (N), (P) is completely uninformative. Even if nominalists endorse a fictionalist view according to which (P) is not equivalent to (N), they can still say that the above explanation is uninformative, because it really just says that gluons are G because they possess a nature that makes it the case that they are G.

Having made the point that the realist explanation of (N) is uninformative and, hence, not genuinely explanatory, the next move that traditional Quinean nominalists make is to appeal to Ockham's razor to argue that we shouldn't believe in Gness (or at least that we shouldn't believe in Gness for any reason that has anything to do with the need to explain things like (N)). Ockham's razor is a principle that tells us that we should believe in objects of a given kind only if they play a genuine explanatory role in our explanations of phenomena. Applied to our case, then, the idea is that if (P) doesn't provide a genuine explanation of (N), and hence, Gness doesn't play a genuine role in an explanation of the fact that gluons are G, then we shouldn't believe in Gness — or, again, we shouldn't believe in it for any reason having to do with the need to explain the fact that gluons are G. We can put this point more simply: there just isn't any reason here for believing in Gness. The One Over Many argument is supposed to provide a positive reason for believing in properties; but since Gness does not play any non-trivial role in our explanation of the fact that a is G, the One Over Many argument does not give us a good reason to believe that there is such a thing as Gness.

The Quinean response to the One Over Many argument that we've been discussing here is often couched in terms of a criterion of ontological commitment. A criterion of ontological commitment is a principle that tells us when we are committed to believing in objects of a certain kind because of having assented to the truth of certain sentences. What the above response to the One Over Many suggests is that we are ontologically committed not by predicates like ‘is red’ and ‘is a rock’, but by singular terms — where a singular term is just a denoting phrase, i.e., an expression that purports to refer to a specific object (e.g., proper names like ‘Mars’ and ‘Clinton’, certain uses of pronouns like ‘she’, and on some views, definite descriptions like ‘the oldest U.S. senator’). More specifically, the idea here seems to be this: if you think that a sentence of the form ‘a is F’ is true, then you have to accept the existence of the object a, but you do not have to accept the existence of a property of Fness; for instance, if you think that ‘The ball is red’ is true, then you have to believe in the ball, but you do not have to believe in redness; or if you think that ‘Fido is a dog’ is true, then you have to believe in Fido but not in the property of doghood.

But this is not all there is to say about ontological commitment. In particular, three points need to be made here. First, the above criterion needs to be generalized so that it covers the use of singular terms in other kinds of sentences, i.e., sentences not of the form ‘a is F’. For instance, according to the view under discussion here, if you think that a sentence of the form ‘a is R-related to b’ is true, then you have to believe in the objects a and b, but you do not have to believe in the relation R; e.g., if you think that the sentence ‘John is in front of Jane’ is true, then you have to believe in John and Jane, but you do not have to believe in the existence of the relation in front of.

Second, on the standard view, we are ontologically committed not just by singular terms but also by existential statements — e.g., by sentences like ‘There are some Fs’, ‘There is at least one F’, and so on (in first-order logic, such sentences are symbolized as ‘(∃x)Fx’, and the ‘∃’ is called an existential quantifier). The standard view here is that if you think that a sentence like this is true, then you are committed to believing in the existence of some Fs (or at least one F) but you do not have to believe in Fness; thus, for instance, if you think that ‘There are some dogs’ is true, then you have to believe that there exist some dogs, but you do not have to believe in the existence of the property of doghood.

Third and finally, it is usually held that we are ontologically committed by singular terms and existential expressions (or existential quantifiers) only if we think that the sentences in which they appear are literally true — or in other words, only if we think that the singular term or existential quantifier in question can't be paraphrased away. We can see what's meant by this by returning to the sentence

(R) The ball possesses the property of redness.

In this sentence, the expression ‘the property of redness’ seems to be a singular term — it seems to denote the property of redness; thus, using the above criterion of ontological commitment, if we think (R) is true, then it would seem, we are committed to believing in the property of redness. But if we endorsed paraphrase nominalism (defined a few paragraphs back) with respect to (R), then we would claim that (R) doesn't really carry an ontological commitment to the property of redness, because it is really just equivalent to the sentence ‘The ball is red’. This idea is often expressed by saying that in (R), the singular term ‘the property of redness’ can be paraphrased away — which is just to say that (R) can be paraphrased by (or is equivalent to) a sentence that doesn't contain the singular term ‘the property of redness’ (namely, ‘The ball is red’). But again, nominalists don't have to endorse paraphrase nominalism with respect to sentences like (R); they can also endorse a fictionalistic view of such sentences, i.e., a view that admits that such sentences do commit to the existence of properties and maintains that because of this (and because there are no such things as properties), these sentences are, strictly speaking, untrue (albeit useful, since we can use them colloquially to say what nominalistically kosher sentences like ‘The ball is red’ say literally).

Having said all of this, we can summarize by saying that the standard view of ontological commitment is as follows:

Criterion of Ontological Commitment: We are ontologically committed by the singular terms in the (simple) sentences that we take to be literally true; and we are ontologically committed by the existential quantifiers in the (existential) sentences that we take to be literally true; but we are not committed by the predicates in such sentences. Thus, for instance, ‘a is F’ commits us to believing in the object a but not the property of Fness; and ‘a is R-related to b’ commits us to the objects a and b but not to the relation R; and ‘There is an F’ commits us to an object that is F but not to Fness.[7]

(It should be noted that Quine formulated his own criterion of ontological commitment in terms of existential statements only — that is, he left out singular terms — but the differences between his criterion and the one given here won't matter for our purposes; all of the crucial points that will be made here in terms of the above criterion could be reformulated in terms of Quine's criterion, although by using the above criterion, we enable these points to be made more easily. Moreover, the criterion listed above is, today, far more widely accepted than is the Quinean criterion.)

Because the above criterion of ontological commitment is now widely accepted among analytic philosophers, the One Over Many argument is widely considered to be a bad argument. The standard view is that the truth of ‘The ball is red’ commits us to believing in the ball but not to redness. Ironically, though, the acceptance of this criterion of ontological commitment has given rise to a very strong argument for the existence of abstract objects. We will call this argument the singular term argument, although one might just as well call it the turning-the-tables-on-the-Quinean-nominalist argument, since as we will see, the strategy is to accept the above criterion of ontological commitment and turn it against the Quinean nominalist.

4. The Singular Term Argument

The general argument strategy here has roots in the work of Plato, but its first clear formulation was given by Frege (1884, 1892, 1893-1903, and 1919). Below we will look very closely at several different versions of the singular term argument (versions applied to different kinds of alleged abstract objects) but let us begin with a general formulation of the argument:

  1. If a simple sentence (i.e., a sentence of the form ‘a is F’, or ‘a is R-related to b’, or…) is literally true, then the objects that its singular terms denote exist (and if an existential sentence (i.e., a sentence of the form ‘There is an F’, or ‘There is an object that's R-related to b, or…) is literally true, then there exist objects of the kind that its existential quantifier ranges over).
  2. There are literally true simple sentences containing singular terms that refer to things that could only be abstract objects (and there are literally true existential statements whose existential quantifiers range over things that could only be abstract objects). Therefore,
  3. There exist abstract objects.

Premise (1) follows straightaway from the criterion of ontological commitment that we discussed in the last section. Again, this is widely accepted among contemporary philosophers, and for good reason — if you think that a sentence of the form ‘a is F’ is literally true and that it cannot be paraphrased into some other sentence, then it's hard to see how you can deny that there is such a thing as the object a. How else could ‘a is F’ be literally true? As was pointed out in section 1, to deny this would be to use ‘true’ in a non-standard way. Thus, in what follows, we will assume that premise (1) is true (for the most part anyway — I will say a few words in section 4.1 about a small group of dissenters). Therefore, since (3) follows trivially from (1) and (2), the central question we have to answer, in order to evaluate the above argument, is whether (2) is true. Now, in order to motivate (2), platonists need to provide some actual examples; that is, they have to produce some sentences and argue that (i) they contain singular terms that can only be taken as referring to abstract objects and (ii) they are literally true (i.e., they are true and they cannot be paraphrased into sentences that don't contain singular terms that denote abstract objects). Platonists maintain that there are many different kinds of such sentences; in particular, they think that for each different category of abstract objects, there are sentences that describe these objects and that are literally true. Thus, there are many different versions of the argument in (1)-(3); in what follows, we will consider versions of this argument that attempt to establish the existence of mathematical objects (e.g., numbers), propositions, properties, relations, sentence types, possible worlds, logical objects, and fictional objects. Now, there is a lot of overlap between these different versions of the argument, so what we will do is proceed very slowly through one version of the argument (the one concerned with mathematical objects) and somewhat slowly through another (the one concerned with propositions) and then we will move more quickly through some other versions of the argument.

4.1 Mathematical Objects

Platonists about mathematical objects claim that the theorems of our mathematical theories — sentences like ‘3 is prime’ (a theorem of arithmetic) and ‘There are infinitely many transfinite cardinal numbers’ (a theorem of set theory) — are literally true and that the only plausible view of such sentences is that they are about abstract objects (i.e., that their singular terms denote abstract objects and their existential quantifiers range over abstract objects). This general stance toward mathematics goes back to Plato, but the first clear statement of the argument in this form was given by Frege (1884); other advocates include Quine (see his 1948 and 1951, though he doesn't explicitly state the argument there), Gödel (1964), Parsons (1965, 1971, 1994), Putnam (1971), Steiner (1975), Zalta (1983), Wright (1983), Hale (1987), Resnik (1981, 1997), Shapiro (1989, 1997), the early Maddy (1990),[8] Katz (1998), and Colyvan (2001).

Let's begin our discussion of the platonists' argument here by considering their reasons for thinking that we cannot plausibly endorse conceptualism or immanent realism (or as they're more commonly called in the philosophy of mathematics, psychologism and physicalism) with respect to mathematical objects. That is, why do platonists think that we have to take sentences like ‘3 is prime’ to be about abstract objects (in particular, numbers) and not ideas in our heads or physical things? Let's start with psychologism and then move on to physicalism.

Frege (1884, introduction and section 27; 1893-1903, introduction; 1894; and 1919) gave several compelling arguments against psychologism. First, it seems that psychologism is incapable of accounting for the truth of sentences that are about all natural numbers, because there are infinitely many natural numbers and clearly, there could not be infinitely many number-ideas in human heads. Second, psychologism seems to entail that sentences about very large numbers (in particular, numbers that no one has ever thought about) are not true; for if none of us has ever thought about some very large number, then (if psychologism were true) no sentence about that number could be true. Third, psychologism seems incapable of accounting for mathematical error: if Jane claims that 4 is prime, we cannot argue with her, because she is presumably saying that her 4 is prime, and for all we know, this could very well be true.[9] Fourth, psychologism turns mathematics into a branch of psychology, and it makes mathematical truths contingent upon psychological truths, so that, for instance, if we all died, ‘4 is greater than 2’ would suddenly become untrue. But this seems wrong: it seems that mathematics is true independently of us; that is, it seems that the question of whether 4 is greater than 2 has nothing at all to do with the question of how many humans are alive. Fifth and finally, psychologism suggests that the proper methodology for mathematics is that of empirical psychology; that is, it seems that if psychologism were true, then the proper way to discover whether, say, there is a prime number between 10,000,000 and 10,000,020, would be to do an empirical study of humans and ascertain whether there is, in fact, an idea of such a number in one of our heads; but of course, this is not the proper methodology for mathematics; the proper methodology involves mathematical proof, not empirical psychology. As Frege says (1884, section 27), “Weird and wonderful…are the results of taking seriously the suggestion that number is an idea.”

It is important to understand what these arguments are really saying about psychologism. Platonists do not deny that there do exist in our heads ideas of mathematical objects. What they deny is that our mathematical sentences are about these ideas. Thus, the dispute between platonism and psychologism is a purely semantic one. Advocates of psychologism agree with platonists that in the sentence ‘3 is prime’, ‘3’ functions as a singular term (i.e., as a denoting expression) but they disagree on the question of what ‘3’ is supposed to refer to. To see that this is a purely semantic dispute, and not an ontological dispute, let us compare psychologism to a fictionalistic version of mathematical nominalism (defended by Field (1980 and 1989), Balaguer (1996a and 1998, chapter 7), Rosen (2001), and Yablo (2002)). Fictionalists maintain that (a) platonists are right that sentences like ‘3 is prime’ are best analyzed as being about abstract objects, but (b) there are no such things as abstract objects, and so (c) sentences like ‘3 is prime’ are not true. Now, whether or not fictionalism is a defensible view, let us consider how it differs from psychologism. The first point to note here is that the two views do not disagree on any ontological or metaphysical thesis. Advocates of fictionalism and psychologism agree that there are no such things as abstract objects, and they agree that there do exist ideas of numbers in our heads.[10] The difference between fictionalism and psychologism is purely semantic. Advocates of psychologism think that sentences like ‘3 is prime’ are about ideas in our heads, whereas fictionalists do not; rather, they agree with platonists that such sentences are supposed to be about abstract objects (but since they don't think there are any such things as abstract objects, they think that mathematical sentences are not true). When we appreciate the fictionalist stance, it becomes clear that platonists are making two distinct claims, one semantic and one ontological: the semantic claim is that our mathematical sentences and theories are best interpreted as purporting to be about abstract objects, and the ontological claim is that there do exist abstract objects of the sort described by our mathematical theories and, hence, that our mathematical theories are true. Given this, we can say that fictionalists reject the platonists' ontological thesis, while advocates of psychologism reject their semantic thesis. (Now, again, advocates of psychologism will usually also reject the platonist's ontological thesis, but on their view, it doesn't matter, for the purposes of the philosophy of mathematics, whether there are any such things as abstract objects, because our mathematical theories aren't about such objects anyway; in short, we can say that in connection with the singular term argument, the important dispute between platonism and psychologism is the semantic dispute.)

Given all of this, we can see now that what the above Fregean arguments are supposed to show is that the psychologistic semantics of mathematical discourse is not correct because it has consequences that fly in the face of the actual usage of mathematical language.

Another argument for the superiority of the platonist/fictionalist semantics over the psychologist semantics is based on the fact that in ordinary usage, one way to say that something doesn't exist is to say that “it exists only in your head”.[11] To say that mathematical objects exist only in our heads, it seems, is just to say that they don't exist. For to say that they (as opposed to our ideas of them) exist is to say that they exist independently of us and our thinking. Quine put this point in a very compelling way in connection with a conceptualistic view of mythical objects like Pegasus. He writes (1948, p. 2):

McX [who maintains that Pegasus exists and is an idea in our heads] never confuses the Parthenon with the Parthenon-idea. The Parthenon is physical; the Parthenon-idea is mental…We cannot easily imagine two things more unlike…But when we shift from the Parthenon to Pegasus, the confusion sets in — for no other reason than that McX would sooner be deceived by the crudest and most flagrant counterfeit than grant the nonbeing of Pegasus.

The same argument can be run against the psychologistic conflation of 3-ideas with 3: you might doubt that there really is such a thing as the number 3, existing objectively and independently of us, but you should not for that reason claim that your idea of 3 is 3, for that is just a confusion — it is like saying that your idea of Pegasus is Pegasus, or that your idea of the Parthenon is the Parthenon.

Let us move on now to immanent-realist, or physicalist, views of mathematics, and let us concentrate first on views like Mill's (1843, book II, chapters 5 and 6), i.e., views that maintain that sentences about numbers are really just general claims about piles of physical objects. On this view, the sentence ‘2 + 1 = 3’, for instance, isn't really about specific objects (the numbers 1, 2, and 3); rather, it says that whenever we add one object to a pile of two objects, we will get a pile of three objects. Now, in order to account for contemporary mathematics in this way, a contemporary Millian would have to take set theory to be about physical piles as well. This, however, is untenable. One argument here is that sets could not be piles of physical stuff, because corresponding to every physical pile, there are many, many sets. Corresponding to a ball, for instance, is the set containing the ball, the set containing its molecules, the set containing its atoms, and so on. (And we know that these are different sets, because they have different members, and it follows from set theory that if set A and set B have different members, then A is not identical to B.) Indeed, the principles of set theory entail that corresponding to every physical object, there is a huge infinity of sets; corresponding to our ball, for instance, there is the set containing the ball, the set containing that set, the set containing that set, and so on; and there is the set containing the ball and the set containing the set containing the ball; and so on and on and on. Clearly, these sets are not just piles of physical stuff, because (a) there are infinitely many of them (again, this follows from the principles of set theory) and (b) all of these infinitely many sets share the same physical base. Thus, there must be some sort of non-physical differences between these sets, and so they could not just be piles of physical stuff.

Another problem with physicalistic views like Mill's is that they seem incapable of accounting for the sheer size of the infinities involved in set theory. Standard set theory entails not just that there are infinitely large sets, but that there are infinitely many sizes of infinity, which get larger and larger with no end, and that there actually exist sets of all of these different sizes of infinity. There is simply no plausible way to take this theory to be about physical stuff in anything like the way that Mill imagined.

(It should be noted that Philip Kitcher (1984) has developed a view that seems like a contemporary version of Millian physicalism. But according to Kitcher's view, mathematical theories are idealized and, hence, they are vacuous — that is, in the end, they are not about anything. Thus, for Kitcher, mathematics is not about the physical world; his view starts out looking somewhat like Mill's, but in the end, he takes mathematics not to be about any actual objects, and so his view is better interpreted as a version of nominalism than a version of physicalism.)

The above arguments against Mill's view do not refute the kind of immanent realism defended by the early Maddy (1990). Maddy's view has no problem accounting for the massive infinities in mathematics, for on her view, corresponding to every physical object, there is a huge infinity of sets that exist in space and time, right where the given physical object exists. This view is very subtle and the question of how platonists could most plausibly undermine it is tricky. There are a number of attacks on this view that the reader can consult — see, e.g., Lavine (1992), Dieterle and Shapiro (1993), Balaguer (1994, 1998), Milne (1994), Riskin (1994), Carson (1996), and the later Maddy (1997) — but here, I will say just a few words about one line of argument. Platonists might claim that Maddy's view encounters problems with branches of mathematics that deal with concepts and properties not instantiated in the physical world. (As we will see below, a similar problem arises for immanent-realist views of properties.) Indeed, one might argue that this problem arises within set theory itself. According to Maddy's theory, the infinity of sets associated with a given physical object is formed into a unique structure, and all set-theoretic questions are answerable by studying that specific structure. But in fact, there are infinitely many different kinds of set-theoretic structures, and platonists can argue that physicalistic views like Maddy's are incompatible with this; for instance, one might argue (see, e.g., Balaguer, 2001) that views like Maddy's are incompatible with how certain open questions (in particular, questions that are undecidable in standard axiomatic systems, e.g., the question about the truth of the Continuum Hypothesis) are handled in set theory; or one might argue (see, e.g., Balaguer, 1998) that on Maddy's view, it is a mystery how human beings could acquire certain kinds of set-theoretic knowledge, because it is a mystery how they could know which kinds of set-theoretic structures are instantiated in the physical world. In short, then, the problem here is similar to one of the central problems with psychologism and less sophisticated versions of physicalism; in particular, the problem is that Maddy's view doesn't deliver enough mathematical objects for mathematicians to work with. (For more on why mathematical realism (of which Maddy's view is an instance) requires more objects than physicalistic views like Maddy's deliver, see Balaguer (1998 and 2001).)

If arguments like the ones we've been discussing here are cogent, then sentences like ‘3 is prime’ are not about physical or mental objects, and therefore, psychologism and physicalism are not tenable views of mathematics. But that is not the end of the singular term argument for the existence of abstract mathematical objects, for we still need to consider nominalistic views of sentences like ‘3 is prime’. In order for platonists to establish their view, they need to refute these nominalistic views as well as psychologistic and physicalistic views. And it should be noted that this is the hard part. There is a good deal of agreement among philosophers of mathematics that psychologism and physicalism are untenable; that is, most philosophers of mathematics are either platonists or nominalists; but there is very little agreement as to whether platonism or nominalism is correct.

How can nominalists proceed in developing an account of sentences like ‘3 is prime’? Well, we've already encountered one strategy here: they can adopt a view along the lines of the second version of Meinongianism, discussed in section 1 (see Routley 1980, Azzouni 1994, and Priest 2003). The view here, recall, is that (a) ‘3 is prime’ should be given a face-value interpretation according to which it really says something about the number 3 (i.e., the sentence doesn't need to be paraphrased into any other sentence), and (b) there is no such thing as the number 3, and yet (c) ‘3 is prime’ is literally true. The problem with this view, in a nutshell, is that it gives up on the criterion of ontological commitment discussed above. Or as we put the point in section 1, this view seems to involve a non-standard use of ‘true’, for most of us would say that if there is no such thing as 3, and if ‘3 is prime’ is read literally (i.e., as being about the number 3), then it follows trivially that ‘3 is prime’ is not true. This, of course, is just to say that most of us accept the criterion of ontological commitment discussed above, but the point here is that this criterion seems to be built into the standard usage of words like ‘true’.

(Another view that might be mentioned here — a view that's related to the second version of Meinongianism but also importantly different — is conventionalism (see, e.g., Ayer (1946, chapter 4), Hempel (1945), and Carnap (1934, 1956)). This view holds that sentences like ‘3 is prime’ and ‘There exist infinitely many prime numbers’ are analytic, i.e., true in virtue of meaning, or linguistic conventions — along the lines of, say, ‘All bachelors are unmarried’ or ‘All warlocks are warlocks’. But again, if we accept the above criterion of ontological commitment, then sentences like ‘3 is prime’ have existential import, and so it's hard to see how they could be true by convention, or true in virtue of meaning. More specifically, it's hard to see how the existence of infinitely many numbers could follow from our accepting a set of linguistic conventions — unless we're talking about some sort of psychologism, a view that we've already dispensed with.)

Given that we want to avoid views like these and hang onto the above criterion of ontological commitment, there are two general strategies that nominalists can adopt in giving a view of mathematical sentences like ‘3 is prime’. First, they can pursue a paraphrase strategy. That is, they can claim that while sentences like ‘3 is prime’ are true, they should not be read as platonists read them, because we can paraphrase these sentences so that they no longer contain singular terms that commit us to the existence of abstract objects. One view of this sort, known as if-thenism, holds that ‘3 is prime’ can be paraphrased by ‘If there were numbers, then 3 would be prime’ (for an early version of this sort of view, see the early Hilbert (1899 and his letters to Frege in Frege (1980)); for later versions, see Putnam (1967a and 1967b) and Hellman (1989)). A second version of the paraphrase strategy, which we can call metamathematical formalism (see Curry (1951)), is that ‘3 is prime’ can be paraphrased by “‘3 is prime’ follows from the axioms of arithmetic”.[12] And a third version, developed by Chihara (1990), is that mathematical sentences that seem to make claims about what mathematical objects exist — e.g., ‘There is a prime number between 2 and 4’ — can be paraphrased into sentences about what it's possible for us to do (in particular, what it's possible for us to write down).

One problem with the various paraphrase views here is (not to put too fine a point on it) none of the paraphrases seems very good. That is, the paraphrases seem to get wrong what we actually mean when we say things like ‘3 is prime’ (and by ‘we’, I mean both mathematicians and ordinary folk). What we mean, it seems, is that 3 is prime — not that if there were numbers, then 3 would be prime, or that the sentence ‘3 is prime’ follows from the axioms of arithmetic, or any such thing. And notice how the situation here differs from cases where we do seem to have good paraphrases. For instance, one might try to claim that if we endorse the sentence

(A1) The average accountant has two children,

then we are ontologically committed to the existence of the average accountant; but in fact, we are not so committed, because (A1) can be paraphrased by the sentence

(A2) On average, accountants have two children,

and this seems to be good paraphrase of (A1), because it seems clear that when people say things like (A1), what they really mean are things like (A2). But in the present case, this seems wrong: it does not seem plausible to suppose that when people say ‘3 is prime’, what they really mean is ‘If there were numbers, then 3 would be prime’.[13] Again, it seems that what we mean here is, very simply, that 3 is prime. That is, it seems that we intend to be talking literally when we say things like ‘3 is prime’; and so it seems that the platonist's face-value semantics for mathematical discourse is correct.

This leads us into the second strategy that nominalists can adopt in giving a view of sentences like ‘3 is prime’. They can admit that the platonist's face-value semantics for such sentences is correct, and they can claim that because of this, these sentences are not true. This is the fictionalist view described above (see Field (1980 and 1989), Balaguer (1996a, 1996b, and 1998), Rosen (2001), and Yablo (2002)). On this view, ‘3 is prime’ is false, or at least not true, because (a) it is making a claim about an abstract object, namely, 3 (or at any rate, it purports to be about an abstract object) but (b) there are no such things as abstract objects. In other words, fictionalists maintain that (a) platonists are right about what our mathematical theories are about (or purport to be about), but (b) there are no such things as abstract objects, and so (c) our mathematical theories are fictions. Thus, on this view, just as Alice in Wonderland is not true because there are no such things as talking rabbits, hookah-smoking caterpillars, and so on, so too our mathematical theories are not true because there are no such things as numbers and sets and so on.[14] Now, this view might seem incredible. How can we seriously claim that ‘3 is prime’ is not true. After all, there is an important difference between sentences like this and sentences like ‘4 is prime’, and the obvious way to capture this difference, it seems, it to maintain that the former are true and the latter are false. But as Field (1980) pointed out when he first introduced the view, fictionalism can be defended against this objection, because we can say that the difference between ‘3 is prime’ and ‘4 is prime’ is analogous to the difference between ‘Oliver Twist lived in London’ and ‘Oliver Twist lived in sin’. While both of the latter two sentences are fictions (and, hence, not literally true), the former is part of the well-known Dickens story, whereas the latter is not. Likewise, mathematical fictionalists can say that while ‘3 is prime’ and ‘4 is prime’ are both literally untrue, the former is true-in-the-story-of-mathematics, whereas the latter is not.

There are a few other minor objections to fictionalism that can be addressed fairly easily (see Balaguer (1998, chapter 1, section 2.2, and chapter 5, section 3) for a discussion of these), but there is one argument against this view that is much more difficult to deal with and that has received a great deal of attention — namely, the Quine-Putnam indispensability argument (see Quine (1948 and 1951) and Putnam (1971)). This argument proceeds as follows: it cannot be that mathematics is untrue, as fictionalists suggest, because (a) mathematics is an indispensable part of our physical theories (e.g., quantum mechanics, general relativity theory, evolution theory, and so on) and so (b) if we want to maintain that our physical theories are true (and surely we do — we don't want our disbelief in abstract objects to force us to be anti-realists about natural science), then we have to maintain that our mathematical theories are true. (It should also be noted here that there are other versions of the Quine-Putnam argument, versions that attack not just fictionalism, but paraphrase nominalism, and indeed, all versions of nominalism.)

The Quine-Putnam argument provides the final building block in the singular term argument for the existence of abstract mathematical objects. In sum, (the mathematical-object version of) the singular term argument is this: (i) sentences like ‘3 is prime’ are literally true (as is shown by the Quine-Putnam argument); and (ii) if such sentences are true, then we are committed to believing in the existence of objects like 3; but (iii) such objects could only be abstract objects because the views that take them to be physical or mental objects are untenable.

(Because the Quine-Putnam indispensability argument raises a problem for nominalism, and because (as we've seen) it is widely thought that platonism and nominalism are the only viable views of mathematics, the Quine-Putnam argument is often thought of as supporting platonism — in particular, it is the most important prong in the singular term argument for mathematical platonism.[15] It should be noted, however, that many people (e.g., Shapiro (1983b, section II.3), Kitcher (1984, pp. 104-05), and Balaguer (1998, chapter 5, section 6)) think that the issue of indispensability generates a problem for platonism that's very similar to the problem it generates for nominalism. Indeed, prima facie, it seems that the only view that's not threatened by indispensability is physicalism — a view that, as we've seen, is untenable for other reasons.)

It was noted above that it is controversial whether platonism or nominalism provides the best view of mathematics. One reason for this is that it is controversial whether the Quine-Putnam argument is cogent. Fictionalists claim that it is not, and they have developed two different responses to the argument. The first response to the Quine-Putnam argument is due to Field (1980). He argues that (i) mathematics is, in fact, not indispensable to empirical science, and (ii) the fact that it is applicable to empirical science in a dispensable way can be accounted for without abandoning fictionalism. Claim (ii) is fairly plausible and has not been subjected to much criticism,[16] but claim (i) is highly controversial. In order to establish thesis (i), we would have to argue that all of our empirical theories can be nominalized, i.e., reformulated in a way that avoids reference to, and existential quantification over, abstract objects. Field (1980) tried to motivate this by carrying out the nominalization for one empirical theory, namely, Newtonian Gravitation Theory, and Balaguer (1996b and 1998, chapter 6) has shown how to extend Field's strategy to quantum mechanics. However, there have been a number of objections raised against Field's nominalization program — see, e.g., Malament (1982), Resnik (1985), and Chihara (1990, chapter 8, section 5) — and the consensus opinion among philosophers of mathematics seems to be that this program cannot be made to work, although this is far from established.

The second fictionalist response to the Quine-Putnam argument has been developed by Balaguer (1996a and 1998, chapter 7), Rosen (2001), and Yablo (2002) (and a somewhat different version of the view was developed by Azzouni (1994) in conjunction with his non-fictionalistic version of nominalism). The idea here is to grant that there do exist indispensable applications of mathematics to empirical science and to simply account for these applications from a fictionalist point of view. Glossing over some details, the central idea behind this view is that because abstract objects are causally inert, and because our empirical theories don't assign any causal role to them, it follows that the truth of empirical science depends upon two sets of facts that are entirely independent of one another; one of these sets of facts is purely platonistic and mathematical, and the other is purely physical, and since these two sets of facts hold or don't hold independently of one another, it could be that the physical facts hold even if the mathematical facts do not hold. Thus, on this view, the purely physical facts could hold — and so the “picture” that empirical science paints of the physical world could be accurate — even if there are no such things as abstract objects and, hence, mathematical fictionalism is true. And so, the argument concludes, fictionalism is consistent with the role that mathematics plays in empirical science, regardless of whether it is indispensable to empirical science.

It should be noted, however, that this fictionalist view is controversial and, more generally, that there is no consensus about whether the version of the singular term argument rehearsed in this section — complete with the Quine-Putnam indispensability argument — provides a good reason for believing in abstract mathematical objects.

4.2 Propositions

Let's move on now to a version of the singular term argument aimed at establishing the existence of propositions. Once again, the most important figure in the development of this argument is Frege (1892, 1919). Other relevant figures (who wouldn't all endorse an argument like the one sketched below) include Russell (1905, 1910-1911), Church (1950, 1954), Quine (1956), Kaplan (1968-69, 1989), Kripke (1972, 1979), Schiffer (1977, 1987, 1994), Perry (1979), Evans (1981), Peacocke (1981), Barwise and Perry (1983), Bealer (1982, 1993), Zalta (1983, 1988), Katz (1986), Salmon (1986), Soames (1987), Forbes (1987), Crimmins and Perry (1989), Richard (1990), Crimmins (1998), Recanati (1993, 2000), Braun (1998), Saul (1999), and Balaguer (forthcoming).

The sentences we will look at here — the sentences that allegedly involve singular terms that refer to propositions — are belief ascriptions, i.e., sentences like ‘Clinton believes that snow is white’ and ‘Emily believes that Santa Claus is fat’. The first point to note about these sentences is that they involve ‘that’-clauses, where a ‘that’-clause is simply the word ‘that’ added to the front of a complete sentence — e.g., ‘that snow is white’. The second point to be made is that ‘that’-clauses, in English, are singular terms. A common way to illustrate this point — see, e.g., Bealer (1982 and 1993), Schiffer (1994), and Balaguer (1998b) — is to appeal to arguments like the following:

I. Clinton believes that snow is white
Therefore, Clinton believes something (namely, that snow is white)

This argument seems to be valid, and moreover, it seems that the only way to account for its validity is to acknowledge that its ‘that’-clauses are singular terms. If the fact that Clinton believes that snow is white entails that Clinton believes at least one thing, namely, that snow is white, then this must mean that that snow is white is a thing that can be believed.

But if ‘that’-clauses are singular terms, what sorts of objects do they refer to? Well, it might seem that they refer to facts, or states of affairs. For instance, it might seem that ‘that snow is white’ refers to the fact that snow is white. This, however, is a mistake. For since beliefs can be false, it follows that ‘that’-clauses refer to things that can be false. E.g., if Sammy is seven years old, then the sentence ‘Sammy believes that snow is powdered sugar’ could very easily be true; but if this sentence is true, then (by our criterion of ontological commitment) its ‘that’-clause refers to a real object; but then it cannot refer to a fact, because (obviously) there is no such thing as the fact that snow is powdered sugar. So it seems that ‘that’-clauses don't refer to facts. (It may be that some ‘that’-clauses refer to facts, but this is not true of the ‘that’-clauses that appear in belief ascriptions.)

These considerations suggest that the referents of ‘that’-clauses — or as they're also called, the objects of belief — are things that have truth values, i.e., things that can be true or false. But it seems that there are only two kinds of things that have truth values, namely, sentences and propositions. Now, platonists about propositions claim that the propositional view is the only plausible view here; that is, they claim that sentential views of ‘that’-clause reference are not tenable. But before we consider their arguments for this claim, we need to say a few words about the different kinds of sentential views that one might endorse.

To begin with, we need to distinguish between sentence types and sentence tokens. To appreciate the difference, consider the following indented sentences:

Cats are cute.
Cats are cute.

We have here two different tokens of a single sentence type — namely, the ‘Cats are cute’ type. A token, then, is an actual physical thing, located at a specific place in spacetime; it is pile of ink on a page (structured in an appropriate way), or a sound wave, or a collection of pixels on a computer screen, or something of this sort. A type, on the other hand, can be tokened numerous times but is not identical with any single token. Thus, a sentence type is an abstract object. And so if we are looking for an anti-platonist view of what ‘that’-clauses refer to, we cannot say that they refer to sentence types; we have to say that they refer to sentence tokens.

A second distinction that needs to be drawn here is between sentence tokens that are external, or public, and sentence tokens that are internal, or private. Examples of external sentence tokens were given in the last paragraph — piles of ink, sound waves, and so on. An internal sentence token, on the other hand, exists inside a particular person's head. There is a wide-spread view — due mainly to Jerry Fodor (1975 and 1987) but adopted by many others, e.g., Stich (1983) — that we are able to perform cognitive tasks (e.g., think, remember information, and have beliefs) only because we are capable of storing information in our heads in a neural language (often called mentalese, or the language of thought). In connection with beliefs, the idea here is that to believe that, say, snow is white, is to have a neural sentence stored in your head (in a belief way, as opposed to a desire way, or some other way) that means in mentalese that snow is white.

This gives us two different anti-platonist alternatives to the view that ‘that’-clauses refer to propositions. First, there is the conceptualistic (or as it's sometimes called, mentalistic) view that ‘that’-clauses refer to sentences in our heads, i.e., to mentalese sentence tokens; e.g., in connection with the sentence ‘Clinton believes that snow is white’, the view here is that ‘that snow is white’ refers to a neural sentence in Clinton's head (again, see Fodor (1975 and 1987) and Stich (1983)). Second, there is the physicalistic view that ‘that’-clauses refer to external sentence tokens, i.e., to piles of ink, and so on (versions of this view have been endorsed by Carnap (1947), Davidson (1967), and Leeds (1979)).

There are a number of arguments that suggest that ‘that’-clauses do not refer to sentences and that we have to take them to refer to propositions. We will rehearse one such argument here, an argument suggesting that ‘that’-clauses don't refer to sentences of any kind — i.e., types, external tokens, or mentalese tokens. Let's begin with tokens, and to this end, let's suppose that S is a sentence token that means that snow is white. S might be a German token, or an English token, or a mentalese token, or a machine-code token (stored on the hard drive of a computer), or whatever — it doesn't matter. Now, consider the following argument:

II. Clinton believes that snow is white.
S means that snow is white.
Therefore, Clinton believes at least one thing, and the thing he believes (or at any rate, one of the things he believes) is what S means.

This argument seems valid, no matter what S is; but this seems to rule out the idea that the ‘that’-clauses here refer to sentence tokens. For (a) in order to account for the validity of the argument, we have to take the two ‘that’-clauses to refer to the same thing, and (b) if we assume that the ‘that’-clauses refer to some sentence token, and let S be that very token, then we arrive at the result that S means itself, which is absurd. The trick here is to notice that (i) ‘that’-clauses refer not just to the objects of belief, but also to meanings, and (ii) sentence tokens aren't meanings (rather, they have meanings). Written tokens of the sentence ‘snow is white’, for instance, have a certain meaning; that is, they express something. The same goes for neural tokens (if there are such things), sound waves, machine-code tokens, and so on. All of these physical structures have meanings, or express things. Moreover, they can all express the same meaning. Therefore, it seems that meanings are not intrinsically tied to any of them. This point is especially important in connection with mentalese tokens, for when the mentalese view first emerged, this point was missed; people failed to appreciate the fact that if we do think in a neural language, then this language has a semantics, which can only mean that it's sentences express things, things other than the sentence themselves. That's what semantics is all about — relations between linguistic items and things “in the world”; if the semantics of a language were exhausted by the fact that its sentences meant themselves, then none of its sentences would say anything about the world — such as that snow is white.[17]

Finally, this argument applies to sentence types as well. The ‘Snow is white’ type means in English that snow is white (in other languages, it might mean something else; e.g., it would be easy to construct a language in which it meant that grass is orange). So unless we're prepared to say that this type means itself in English, which again is absurd, we cannot say that the ‘that’-clauses in argument (II) refer to the ‘snow is white’ type. And so, in general, we cannot say that ‘that’-clauses refer to sentence types. Thus, since we've already seen that they don't refer to tokens, it follows that they don't refer to sentences of any kind. And so, the argument concludes, they must refer to propositions.[18]

Now, notice that the issue so far has been purely semantic. What the above argument suggests is that regardless of whether there are any such things as propositions, our ‘that’-clauses are best interpreted as referring to — or purporting to refer to — propositions. Platonists then claim that if this is correct, then there must be such things as propositions, because, clearly, many of our belief ascriptions are true. For instance, ‘Clinton believes that snow is white’ is true; thus, if the above analysis of ‘that’-clauses is correct, and if our criterion of ontological commitment is correct, it follows that there is such a thing as the proposition that snow is white.[19]

This version of the singular term argument might seem even more powerful than the mathematical-object version of the singular term argument sketched in section 4.1, because in this case, it doesn't seem that there is as much room for paraphrase nominalism. We saw in section 4.1 that there are a number of programs for paraphrasing the statements of mathematics, but there are no obvious strategies for paraphrasing ordinary belief ascriptions. One might think this could be done by taking sentences of the form ‘S believes that p’ to mean ‘If there existed propositions, then S would believe that p’; but this sort of view is even less plausible here than it is in the mathematical case. It is just wildly implausible to suppose that when common folk say things like ‘Clinton believes that his presidency was successful’, they mean to be making hypothetical claims about what the person in question would believe in some alternate situation; it seems entirely obvious that when we say things like this, we mean to be making straightforward factual claims about what the person in question does believe.

However, while paraphrase nominalism seems hopeless in the case of propositions, Balaguer (1998b) has argued that his version of fictionalistic nominalism carries over very well to the case of propositions. Just as mathematical fictionalists maintain that purely mathematical sentences are not true because their singular terms have no referents, so too, semantic fictionalists (as Balaguer calls them) can maintain that sentences purely about propositions — e.g., ‘That some snow is white entails that something is white’ — are not true because their singular terms have no referents. But just as fictionalists have to account for the usefulness of mathematics in our descriptions of the physical world, so too, they have to account for the usefulness of ‘that’-clauses in our descriptions of the physical world. This is where belief ascriptions come in: we use ‘that’-clauses to make apparently true claims about the physical world, e.g., about people's beliefs. Now, it is not at all obvious how Field's version of fictionalism could be extended to the case of propositions; that would require us to nominalize our ordinary theories of belief and token meaning and so on, and it is not clear how one might go about doing this. But the Balaguer-Rosen-Yablo version of fictionalism doesn't require us to nominalize our ordinary talk about beliefs; on this view, we can simply say that, e.g., the sentence ‘Clinton believes that snow is white’ is strictly speaking not true (because there is no such thing as the proposition that snow is white), but that it still succeeds in painting an accurate picture of Clinton's belief state. And the reason that sentences like this (i.e., belief ascriptions) can succeed in painting accurate pictures of the world is, according to Balaguer, exactly analogous to the reason that empirical-scientific sentences containing mathematical singular terms can succeed in painting accurate pictures of the world (see section 4.1 for more on this point).

4.3 Properties and Relations

One way to argue for a platonistic view of properties and relations is first to use the argument of section 4.2 to argue for a platonistic view of propositions, and then to claim that this argument already contains an argument for properties and relations, because properties and relations are components of propositions. If we adopt a Russellian view of propositions, then this is straightforward, because it is built into the Russellian view that propositions are composed of objects, properties, and relations (see section 1). If we adopt a Fregean view of propositions, however, the situation is different. On the Fregean view, propositions are composed of senses, or meanings, or concepts. Thus, on this view, if we have good reason to countenance the existence of, e.g., the proposition that roses are red, then we also have good reason to countenance the existence of the concept of redness (or as some might want to put it, the concept red). Now, some Fregeans might want to say that the property of redness just is the concept of redness, and if so, then they could maintain with Russellians that if there exist propositions, then there also exist properties and relations. But on the other hand, Fregeans might want to resist the idea that properties are concepts, and if they do, then in order to motivate a platonistic view about properties and relations, they would need an entirely different argument. And since we have already found that the One Over Many argument for properties and relations is not cogent, this other argument would presumably be a version of the singular term argument, one that was aimed specifically at establishing the existence of properties and relations.

The most obvious way to formulate an independent property-and-relation version of the singular term argument would be to appeal to sentences like

(P1) Mars possesses the property of redness

and

(R1) San Francisco stands in the north-of relation to Los Angeles.

In order to make out a version of the singular term argument here, platonists would need to begin by arguing that these sentences commit to the existence of the property of redness and the north-of relation, respectively, because (a) they have singular terms that denote those things, and (b) they are true. In order to motivate claim (a), platonists one would have to refute the paraphrase-nominalist claim that sentences like (P1) and (R1) are equivalent to sentences like ‘Mars is red’ and ‘San Francisco is north of Los Angeles’, which don't contain singular terms that denote (or purport to denote) properties or relations. And in order to motivate claim (b), platonists would have to refute the fictionalist view that sentences like (P1) and (R1) are untrue because they do commit to the existence of properties and relations and because there are no such things as properties and relations (of course, fictionalists admit that (P1) and (R1) are useful fictions that succeed in painting accurate pictures of parts of the physical world — see section 3).[20]

If platonists managed to establish the existence of properties and relations in this way, they would still need to argue that such things could only be abstract objects. That is, they would have to argue that properties and relations couldn't be ideas in our heads (as conceptualists claim) or in physical things (as immanent realists claim).

There are a number of arguments that platonists could use here against conceptualism. Indeed, virtually all of the arguments listed above for thinking that numbers couldn't be ideas in our heads apply also to properties and relations: (i) As Russell (1912, chapter IX) points out, property claims and relational claims seem to be objective; e.g., that fact that Mount Everest is taller than Mont Blanc is a fact that holds independently of us; but conceptualism about universals entails that if we all died, it would no longer be true that Mount Everest is taller than Mont Blanc, because the relation is taller than would no longer exist. (ii) If conceptualism were true, it would seem to imply that mistaken property claims are impossible, or at least much less common than we ordinarily suppose; e.g., if Ralph said that Mont Blanc was round, then he might very well be right, because he would presumably be talking about his property of roundness, and this could be just about anything. And (iii) Conceptualism seems simply to get the semantics of our property discourse wrong, for it seems to confuse properties with our ideas of them. The English sentence ‘Red is a color’ does not seem to be about anybody's idea of redness; it seems to be about redness, the actual color, which, it seems, is something objective.

There are also some very famous arguments against the immanent realist view of properties and relations. First, it is not clear that it is coherent to say that there is such a thing as redness and that this one thing exists in many different objects at the same time. Second, it is not clear what it is for an object to possess a property, on the immanent realist view. Most immanent realists would not say that property possession is a full-blown relation, for this would just be another universal, and it is commonly thought that if immanent realists adopted this view, it would lead to an unacceptable infinite regress. (If we're told that an object a possesses Fness iff a stands in the possession relation to Fness, then one might ask, “What is it for an object and a property to stand in the possession relation to one another?”, and so on.) In light of this, many immanent realists maintain that when an object a possesses a property Fness, a and Fness are “linked together” in some non-relational way, e.g., a way that is more intimate, or primitive, than ordinary relational connections. But it is not clear what this really amounts to. (Immanent realists might respond that platonists also have a problem here — i.e., that platonists also have to provide an account of the relation, or “connection”, between objects and properties. But some platonists might argue that the problem isn't as bad for them because platonistic properties are causally inert and, hence, not responsible in any way for objects having the natures they do. For instance, if a is F, Fness is not responsible in any way for a having the nature that it has. Thus, platonists might claim that a is simply an example of Fness and that there is no more to their relation than that.[21] Immanent realists, however, think that ordinary physical objects are the way they are because they possess the properties they do. Thus, they seem committed to the thesis that there is some sort of physically substantial connection, or link, between objects and their properties, and it is not at all clear what this could be. There has been a lot of philosophy dedicated to this problem, but there is no consensus about how (or whether) it can be solved.)

It is worth noting that platonists who argue for properties and relations in conjunction with propositions — i.e., by first arguing for propositions and then claiming that properties and relations are components of propositions — will have an easier time arguing that properties and relations couldn't be in our heads (as conceptualists say) or in things (as immanent realists say). In connection with conceptualism, platonists of this sort could claim that the argument given in section 4.2 for thinking that ‘that’-clauses don't refer to mentalese sentences suggests that propositions (which are the referents of ‘that’-clauses) could not be made up of properties that exist in our heads. And in connection with immanent realism, platonists of this sort could argue that propositions couldn't be composed of immanent-realist properties, because people can believe propositions that are composed of properties that are not instantiated in the physical world. For instance, it seems that sentences like ‘Johnny believes that there is a four-hundred-story building in Sally's backyard’ can be true, and so according to the above platonist argument for propositions, there must be such a thing as the proposition that there is a four-hundred-story building in Sally's backyard. But if propositions have properties as components, then this proposition has as a component the property of being a four-hundred-story building. But if properties exist only in physical things, as immanent realists suggest, then there is no such thing as the property of being a four-hundred-story building, since presumably, nothing in the universe has this property. Thus, the conclusion here is that if propositions have properties as components, then the properties in question have to be transcendent, platonist properties, not immanent properties.[22]

4.4 Sentence Types

Linguistics is a branch of science that tells us things about sentences. For instance, it says things like

(A) ‘The cat is on the mat’ is a well-formed sentence of English,

and

(B) ‘Visiting relatives can be boring’ is structurally ambiguous.

The quoted sentences that appear in (A) and (B) are singular terms; e.g., “‘The cat is on the mat’” refers to the sentence ‘The cat is on the mat’, and (A) says of this sentence that it has a certain property, namely, that of being a well-formed English sentence. Thus, if sentences like (A) are true — and it certainly seems that they are — then they commit us to believing in the existence of sentences. Now, one might hold a physicalistic view here according to which linguistics is about actual (external) sentence tokens, e.g., piles of ink and verbal sound waves (this view was popular in the early part of the 20th century — see, e.g., Bloomfield (1933), Harris (1954), and Quine (1953)). Or alternatively, one might hold a conceptualistic view, maintaining that linguistics is essentially a branch of psychology; the main proponent of this view is Noam Chomsky (1965, chapter 1), who thinks of a grammar for a natural language as being about an ideal speaker-hearer's knowledge of the given language, but see also Sapir (1921), Stich (1972), and Fodor (1981). But there are reasons for thinking that neither the physicalist nor the conceptualist approach is tenable and that the only plausible way to interpret linguistic theory is as being about sentence types, which of course, are abstract objects (proponents of the platonistic view include Katz (1981), Soames (1985), and Langendoen and Postal (1985)). Katz constructs arguments here that are very similar to the ones we considered above, in connection with mathematical objects (section 4.1). One argument here is that linguistic theory seems to have consequences that are (a) true and (b) about sentences that have never been tokened (internally or externally), e.g., sentences like ‘Green Elvises slithered unwittingly toward Arizona's favorite toaster’ (of course, now that I've written this sentence down, it has been tokened, but it seems likely that before I wrote it down, it had never been tokened). Standard linguistic theory entails theorems that say that sentences like this — i.e., sentences that have never been tokened (internally or externally) — are well-formed English sentences; therefore, if we want to claim that our linguistic theories are true (and platonists claim that we have good reasons to suppose that they are true), then we have to accept that the theorems in question are also true. But they are clearly not true of any sentence tokens (because the sentences in question have never been tokened) and so, it is argued, they must be true of sentence types.

4.5 Possible Worlds

It is a very widely held view among contemporary philosophers that in theorizing about the world, we need to appeal to entities known as possible worlds in order to account for various phenomena. There are dozens of phenomena that various philosophers have thought should be explained in terms of possible worlds, but to name just one, it is often argued that semantic theory is best carried out in terms of possible worlds. To give one example here, consider the attempt to state the truth conditions of sentences of the form ‘It is necessary that S’ and ‘It is possible that S’ (where S is any sentence); it is widely believed that the best theory here is that a sentence of the form ‘It is necessary that S’ is true if and only if S is true in all possible worlds, and a sentence of the form ‘It is possible that S’ is true if and only if S is true in at least one possible world. Now, if we add to this theory the premise that at least one sentence of the form ‘It is possible that S’ is true — and this seems undeniable — then we are led to the result that there do exist possible worlds. Consider, for instance, the sentence ‘It is possible that Clinton will die at age 87’; this seems undeniably true, and so if the above theory of the semantics of such sentences is correct, then we also have to accept the truth of the following sentence:

(C) There is at least one possible world in which ‘Clinton will die at age 87’ is true.

But of course, if (C) is true, then it commits us to the existence of a possible world. Now, as was the case with numbers, properties, and sentences, not everyone who endorses possible worlds thinks that they are abstract objects; indeed, the leading proponent of the use of possible worlds in our theorizing about the world — namely, David Lewis (1986) — maintains that possible worlds are of the same kind as the actual world, and so he takes them to be concrete objects. However, most philosophers who endorse possible worlds take them to be abstract objects (see, e.g., Plantinga (1974, 1976), Adams (1974), Chisholm (1976), and Pollock (1984)). It is important to note, however, that possible worlds are very often not taken to constitute a new kind of abstract object. For instance, it is very popular to maintain that a possible world is just a set of propositions. (To see how a set of propositions could serve as a possible world, notice that if you believed in full-blown possible worlds — worlds that are just like the actual world in kind — then you would say that corresponding to each of these worlds, there is a set of propositions that completely and accurately describes the given world, or is true of that world. Well, many philosophers who don't believe in full-blown possible worlds maintain that these sets of propositions are good enough — i.e., that we can take them to be possible worlds.) Or alternatively, one might think of a possible world as a state of affairs, or as a way things could be; in so doing, one might think of these as constituting a new kind of abstract object, or one might think of them as properties — giant, complex properties that the entire universe may or may not possess. For instance, one might say that the actual universe possesses the property of being such that snow is white and grass is green and San Francisco is north of Los Angeles, and so on.

4.6 Logical Objects

Frege (1884, 1893-1903) appealed to sentences like the following:

(D) The number of Fs is identical to the number of Gs if and only if there is a one-to-one correspondence between the Fs and the Gs. (This is known as Hume's Principle. Here's an example: the number of chickens is identical to the number of Virginians if and only if there is a one-to-one correspondence between the chickens and the Virginians.)

(E) The direction of line a is identical to the direction of line b if and only if a is parallel to b.

(F) The shape of figure a is identical to the shape of figure b if and only if a is geometrically similar to b.

On Frege's view, principles like these are true, and so they commit us to the existence of numbers, lines, and shapes (e.g., squares and circles). Now, of course, we have already gone through a platonistic argument — indeed, a Fregean argument — for the existence of numbers. Moreover, the standard platonist view is that the argument for the existence of mathematical objects is entirely general, covering all branches of mathematics, including geometry, so that on this view, we already have reason to believe in lines and shapes, as well as numbers. But it is worth noting that in contrast to most contemporary platonists, Frege thought of numbers, lines, and shapes as logical objects, because on this view, these things can be identified with extensions of concepts. What is the extension of a concept? Well, simplifying a bit, it is just the set of things falling under the given concept. Thus, for instance, the extension of the concept white is just the set of white things.[23] And so the idea here is that since logic is centrally concerned with predicates and their corresponding concepts, and since extensions are tied to concepts, we can think of extensions as logical objects. Thus, since Frege thinks that numbers, lines, and shapes can be identified with extensions, on his view, we can think of these things as logical objects.

Frege's definitions of numbers, lines, and shapes in terms of extensions can be formulated as follows: (i) the number of Fs is the extension of the concept equinumerous with F (that is, it is the set of all concepts that have exactly as many objects falling under them as does F); and (ii) the direction of line a is the extension of the concept parallel to a; and (iii) the shape of figure a is the extension of the concept geometrically similar to a. A similar approach can be used to define other kinds of logical objects. For instance, the truth value of the proposition p can be identified with the extension of the concept equivalent to p (i.e., the concept true if and only if p is true).

For contemporary work on this issue, see, e.g., Wright (1983), Boolos (1986-87), and Anderson and Zalta (2004).

4.7 Fictional Objects

Finally, a number of philosophers (see, most notably, van Inwagen (1977), Zalta (1983, 1988), Salmon (1998), and Thomasson (1999)) think that fictional objects, or fictional characters, are best thought of as abstract objects. To see why one might be drawn to this view, consider the following sentence:

(G) Sherlock Holmes is a detective.

Now, if this sentence actually appeared in one of the Holmes stories by Arthur Conan Doyle, then that token of it would not be true — it would be a bit of fiction. But if you were telling a child about these stories, and the child asked, “What does Holmes do for a living?”, and you answered by uttering (G), then it seems plausible to suppose that what you have said is true. But if it is true, then it seems that its singular term, ‘Sherlock Holmes’, must refer to something. What it refers to, according to the view in question, is an abstract object, in particular, a fictional character. In short, present-day utterances of (G) are true statements about a fictional character; but if Doyle had put (G) into one his stories, it would not have been true, and its singular term would not have referred to anything.

There is a worry about this view that can be put in the following way: if there is such a thing as Sherlock Holmes, then it has arms and legs; but if Sherlock Holmes is an abstract object, as this view supposes, then it does not have arms and legs (because abstract objects are non-physical); therefore, it cannot be the case that Sherlock Holmes exists and is an abstract object, for this leads to contradiction. Most advocates of the platonistic view of fictional objects solve this problem in a similar kind of way. Zalta's solution is perhaps the clearest version of the general strategy. His idea is that in addition to possessing certain properties, abstract objects also encode properties. The fictional character Sherlock Holmes encodes the properties of being a detective, being male, being English, having arms and legs, and so on. But it does not possess any of these properties. It possesses the properties of being abstract, being a fictional character, having been thought of first by Arthur Conan Doyle, and so on. Zalta maintains that in English, the copula ‘is’ — as in ‘a is F’ — is ambiguous; it can be read as ascribing either property possession or property encoding. When we say ‘Sherlock Holmes is a detective’, we are saying that Holmes encodes the property of being a detective; and when we say ‘Sherlock Holmes is a fictional character’, we are saying that Holmes possesses the property of being a fictional character. (It should be noted that Zalta employs the device of encoding with respect to all abstract objects — mathematical objects, logical objects, and so on — not just fictional objects; moreover, Zalta points out that his theory of encoding is based on a similar theory developed by Ernst Mally (1912).)

Those who endorse a platonistic view of fictional objects maintain that there is no good paraphrase of sentences like (G), but one might question this. For instance, one might maintain that (G) can be paraphrased into a sentence that asserts something to the effect that the sentence ‘Sherlock Holmes is a detective’ is true-in-the-Holmes-stories, or part of the Holmes stories, or something along these lines. If we read (G) in this way, then it is not be about Sherlock Holmes at all; rather, it is about the Sherlock Holmes stories. Thus, in order to believe (G), so interpreted, one would have to believe in the existence of these stories. Now, one might try to take an anti-platonistic view of the nature of stories, but there are problems with such views, and so we might end up with a platonistic view here anyway — a view that takes sentences like (G) to be about stories and stories to be abstract objects of some sort, e.g., ordered sets of propositions.[24] Which of these platonistic views is superior can be settled by determining which (if either) captures the correct interpretation of sentences like (G) — i.e., by determining whether ordinary people who utter sentences like (G) are best interpreted as talking about stories or about actually existing fictional characters.

5. The Epistemological Argument Against Platonism

Over the years, anti-platonist philosophers have presented a number of arguments against platonism. One of these arguments stands out as the strongest, namely, the epistemological argument. In this section, we will discuss this argument and look at how platonists have tried to respond to it. The argument goes all the way back to Plato, but it has received renewed interest since 1973, when Paul Benacerraf presented a version of the argument. Most of the work on this problem has taken place in the philosophy of mathematics, in connection with the platonistic view of mathematical objects like numbers; thus, we will discuss the argument in this context, but all of the issues and arguments can be reproduced in connection with other kinds of abstract objects. The argument can be put in the following way (Balaguer, 1998):

  1. Human beings exist entirely within spacetime.

  2. If there exist any abstract mathematical objects, then they exist outside of spacetime. Therefore, it seems very plausible that:

  3. If there exist any abstract mathematical objects, then human beings could not attain knowledge of them. Therefore,

  4. If mathematical platonism is correct, then human beings could not attain mathematical knowledge.

  5. Human beings have mathematical knowledge. Therefore,

  6. Mathematical platonism is not correct.

The argument for (3) is everything here. If it can be established, then so can (6), because (3) trivially entails (4), (5) is beyond doubt, and (4) and (5) trivially entail (6). Now, (1) and (2) do not strictly entail (3), and so there is room for platonists to maneuver here — and as we'll see, this is precisely how most platonists have responded. However, it is important to notice that (1) and (2) provide a strong prima facie motivation for (3), because they seem to imply that mathematical objects (if there are such things) are totally inaccessible to us, i.e., that information cannot pass from mathematical objects to human beings. But this gives rise to a prima facie worry (which may or may not be answerable) about whether human beings could acquire knowledge of mathematical objects. Thus, we should think of this argument not as refuting platonism but as issuing a challenge to platonists; the challenge is simply to explain how human beings could acquire knowledge of abstract mathematical objects.

There are three ways for platonists to respond. First, they can argue that (1) is false and that the human mind is capable of somehow forging contact with abstract mathematical objects and thereby acquiring information about such objects; this strategy has been pursued by Plato (see The Meno and The Phaedo) and Gödel (1964). Plato's idea is that our immaterial souls acquired knowledge of abstract objects before we were born and that mathematical learning is really just a process of coming to remember what we knew before we were born. On Gödel's version of the view, we acquire knowledge of abstract objects in much the same way that we acquire knowledge of concrete physical objects; more specifically, just as we acquire information about physical objects via the faculty of sense perception, so we acquire information about abstract objects by means of a faculty of mathematical intuition. Now, other philosophers have endorsed the idea that we possess a faculty of mathematical intuition, but Gödel's version of this view — and he seems to be alone in this — involves the idea that the mind is non-physical in some sense and that we are capable of forging contact with, and acquiring information from, non-physical mathematical objects.[25] This view has been almost universally rejected. One problem is that denying (1) doesn't seem to help; for the idea of an immaterial mind receiving information from an abstract object seems just as mysterious and confused as the idea of a physical brain receiving information from an abstract object.

The second strategy that platonists (or at any rate, non-traditional platonists of a certain sort — more on this in a moment) can pursue in responding to the epistemological argument is to argue that (2) is false and that human beings can acquire information about mathematical objects via normal perceptual means. The early Maddy (1990) pursued this idea in connection with set theory, claiming that sets of physical objects can be taken to exist in spacetime and, hence, that we can perceive them. For instance, on her view, if there are two books on a table, then the set containing these books exists on the table, in the same place that the books exist, and we can see the set and acquire information about it in this way. This view has been subjected to much criticism, including arguments from the later Maddy (1997). Others to attack the view include Lavine (1992), Dieterle and Shapiro (1993), Balaguer (1994, 1998), Milne (1994), Riskin (1994), and Carson (1996).

(According to the definitions we've been using here, views like Maddy's — in particular, views that reject premise (2) — are not versions of platonism at all, because they do not take mathematical objects to exist outside of spacetime. Nonetheless, there is some rationale for thinking of Maddy's view as a sort of non-traditional platonism. For since Maddy's view entails that there is an infinity of sets associated with every ordinary physical object, all sharing the same spatiotemporal location and the same physical matter, she has to allow that these sets differ from one another in some sort of non-physical way and, hence, that there is something about these sets that is non-physical, or perhaps abstract, in some sense of these terms. Now, of course, the question of whether Maddy's view counts as a version of platonism is purely terminological; but whatever we say about this — in particular, even if we stick with the traditional definitions we've been using here and maintain that Maddy's view is not a version of platonism — the view is still worth considering in the present context, because it is widely thought of as one of the available responses to the epistemological argument against platonism, and indeed, that is the spirit in which Maddy originally presented the view.)

The third and final strategy that platonists can pursue is to accept (1) and (2) and explain why (3) is nonetheless false. This strategy is different from the first two in that it doesn't involve the postulation of an information-transferring contact between human beings and abstract objects. The idea here is to grant that human beings do not have such contact with abstract objects and to explain how they can nonetheless acquire knowledge of such objects. This has been the most popular strategy among contemporary platonists. Its advocates include Quine (1951, section 6), Steiner (1975, chapter 4), Parsons (1980, 1994), Katz (1981, 1998), Resnik (1982, 1997), Wright (1983), Lewis (1986, section 2.4), Hale (1987), Shapiro (1989, 1997), Balaguer (1995, 1998), and Linsky and Zalta (1995). There are several different versions of this view; we will look very briefly at the most prominent of them.

One version of the third strategy, implicit in the writings of Quine (1951, section 6) and developed by Steiner (1975, chapter four, especially section IV) and Resnik (1997, chapter 7), is to argue that we have good reason to believe that our mathematical theories are true, even though we don't have any contact with mathematical objects, because (a) these theories are embedded in our empirical theories, and (b) these empirical theories (including their mathematical parts) have been confirmed by empirical evidence, and so (c) we have empirical evidence for believing that our mathematical theories are true and, hence, that there exist abstract mathematical objects. Notice that this view involves the controversial thesis that confirmation is holistic, i.e., that entire theories are confirmed by pieces of evidence that seem to confirm only parts of theories. One might doubt that confirmation is holistic in this way. Moreover, even if one grants that confirmation is holistic, one might worry that this view leaves unexplained the fact that mathematicians are capable of acquiring knowledge of their theories before these theories are applied in empirical science.

A second version of the third strategy, developed by Katz (1981, 1998) and Lewis (1986, section 2.4), is to argue that we can know that our mathematical theories are true, without any sort of information-transferring contact with mathematical objects, because these theories are necessarily true. The reason we need information-transferring contact with ordinary physical objects in order to know what they're like is that these objects could have been different. For instance, we have to look at fire engines in order to know that they're red, because they could have been blue. But we don't need any contact with the number 4 in order to know that it is the sum of 3 and 1, because it is necessarily the sum of 3 and 1. (For criticisms of this view, see Field (1989, pp. 233-38) and Balaguer (1998, chapter 2, section 6.4).)

A third version of the third strategy has been developed by Resnik (1997) and Shapiro (1997). Both of these philosophers endorse (platonistic) structuralism, a view that holds that our mathematical theories provide true descriptions of mathematical structures, which, according to this view, are abstract. Moreover, Resnik and Shapiro both claim that human beings can acquire knowledge of mathematical structures (without coming into any sort of information-transferring contact with such things) by simply constructing mathematical axiom systems; for, they argue, axiom systems provide implicit definitions of structures. One problem with this view, however, is that it does not explain how we could know which of the various axiom systems that we might formulate actually pick out structures that exist in the mathematical realm.

A fourth and final version of the third strategy, developed by Balaguer (1995, 1998) (and see Linsky and Zalta (1995) for a related view), is based upon the adoption of a particular version of platonism that can be called plenitudinous platonism, or as Balaguer calls it, full-blooded platonism (FBP). FBP can be intuitively but sloppily expressed with the slogan, ‘All possible mathematical objects exist’; more precisely, the view is that all the mathematical objects that possibly could exist actually do exist, or that there exist as many mathematical objects as there possibly could. Balaguer argues that if platonists endorse FBP, then they can solve the epistemological problem with their view without positing any sort of information-transferring contact between human beings and abstract objects. For since FBP says that all possible mathematical objects exist, it follows that if FBP is true, then every purely mathematical theory that could possibly be true (i.e., that's internally consistent) accurately describes some collection of actually existing mathematical objects. Thus, it follows from FBP that in order to attain knowledge of abstract mathematical objects, all we have to do is come up with an internally consistent purely mathematical theory (and know that it is consistent). But it seems clear that (i) we humans are capable of formulating internally consistent mathematical theories (and of knowing that they're internally consistent), and (ii) being able to do this does not require us to have any sort of information-transferring contact with the abstract objects that the theories in question are about. Thus, if this is right, then the epistemological problem with platonism has been solved.

One might object here that in order for humans to acquire knowledge of abstract objects in this way, they would first need to know that FBP is true. Balaguer responds to this objection in detail in his (1998). Very briefly, what he argues is that FBP-ists do not have to explain how humans could know that FBP is true in order to adequately respond to the epistemological argument against platonism. Balaguer's argument for this is based on the claim that to demand that FBP-ists explain how humans could know that FBP is true is exactly analogous to demanding that external-world realists (i.e., those who believe that there is a real physical world, existing independently of us and our thinking) explain how human beings could know that there is an external world of a kind that gives rise to accurate sense perceptions. Thus, Balaguer argues that while there may be some sort of Cartesian-style skeptical argument against FBP here (analogous to skeptical arguments against external-world realism), the argument in (1)-(6) is supposed to be a different kind of argument, and in order to respond to that argument, FBP-ists do not have to explain how humans could know that FBP is true. For a more complete discussion, see Balaguer (1998, pp. 53-58).

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abstract objects | Frege, Gottlob | logic and ontology | mathematics, philosophy of | mathematics, philosophy of: Platonism | nominalism: in metaphysics | Plato | possible worlds | properties | propositional attitude reports | propositions | Quine, Willard van Orman | reference