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Quantum Field Theory

First published Thu 22 Jun, 2006

Quantum Field Theory (QFT) is the mathematical and conceptual framework for contemporary elementary particle physics. Since the very beginning of western philosophy reflections about the material world which go beyond the directly observable play a central role in philosophy. Starting with the presocratics it has always been a point of debate what the fundamental characteristics of the material world are. Is everything constantly changing or are there certain permanent features? What is basic and what is merely a matter of perspective and appearance? In the course of time various answers have been given and conflicting views have often been alternating in their predominance. QFT is presently the best starting point for analysing the fundamental features of matter and interactions. In a rather informal sense QFT is the extension of QM (dealing with particles) over to fields. (See the entry on quantum mechanics.) The tools of QFT allow us to treat physical systems that have an infinite number of degrees of freedom. Its mathematical structure allows to analyse the creation and annihilation of “particles” like electrons and photons. QFT is relativistically invariant in a way which is not possible in QM. This can easily be demonstrated in Quantum Electrodynamics, the QFT of interactions between charged particles and the electromagnetic field.

During the last two decades QFT became a more and more vividly discussed topic in philosophy of physics. QFT is an attractive topic for philosophers with respect to methodology, semantics as well as ontology. Indeed, from a methodological point of view QFT is much more a set of formal strategies and mathematical tools than a closed theory. Its development was accompanied by problems provoked by the application of badly defined mathematics. Nevertheless, empirically such pragmatic approaches have been far more successful so far than more rigorous formulations. How could such a theory work for more than 70 years? Since mathematical reasoning dominated the heuristics of QFT, its interpretation is open in most areas which go beyond the immediate empirical predictions. Philosophical analysis might help to clarify its semantics. QFT taken seriously in its metaphysical implications seems to give a picture of the world which is at variance with central classical conceptions like particles and fields and even with some features of quantum mechanics (QM).

1. Why Philosophy of QFT?

On first sight it might be surprising that the discussion on the conceptual foundations of the quantum domain has always been primarily concerned with QM and not with QFT. After all QFT is, in a certain sense, more comprehensive than QM and in particular relativistically invariant in contrast to QM. There have been at least two reasons for neglecting QFT in favour of QM regarding conceptual reflections. First, for a long time the attitude was dominating that the decisive philosophical problems, in particular the measurement problem, show up in QM already so that a conceptual analysis of QFT appeared not to be necessary. It even seemed that looking at QFT would only blur the view on the central features since QFT is much more complex and mathematically advanced than standard QM. A second reason for neglecting QFT was the fact that QFT has not yet reached the status of a consistent and complete theory. In addition the lack of a quantum field theory of gravitation is felt as a pressing need. Since it cannot be excluded that the incorporation of the fourth fundamental force might lead to deep changes of QFT as a whole, the current version of QFT must be seen as a preliminary theory. However, if one were to wait for its completion it is very likely that a philosophical analysis of QFT would never even start. Interpretational reflections on the foundations of physics and its inconsistencies might even help in the search for the final theory. In any case, some quantum stuctures have been very steady for more than 70 years now and lead to strikingly good predictions so that the belief is well-grounded that at least a good part of these stuctures will remain in all improved theories.

There have been various studies on the historical development of QFT and in particular Quantum Electrodynamics (QED). This is partly due to some charismatic figures involved, especially Richard Feynman, and some spectacular successes of methods like renormalization theory, Feynman diagrams and the extensive use of symmetry groups. For the preference of historical studies on QFT over philosophical ones it might have been more important, however, that history does not change afterwards like theories do. QFT as an object of philosophical reflection only began to receive wider attention in the late 1980s when the two above-mentioned arguments against QFT as a philosophical topic became less important for the following reasons. First, careful analyses of the specifically relativistic traits of QFT led to results, e.g., about localizability, which at least aggravate the conceptual problems of QM severely and possibly even give rise to qualitatively new problems. Second, due to the development of QFT and of the theory of superstrings in the last two decades the initial hope is fading away that QFT is near to its final completion and this fact speaks against a further postponement of philosophical analyses of QFT.

Some further arguments support the hope that a conceptual analysis of QFT will deliver results which finally enable us to tackle problems which seemed insoluble when looking at QM. The fundamental difficulty to find and to understand the nature of the basic entities of the quantum regime might, looking at QFT, lead to a solution which only makes it necessary to explain why we have the impression of ‘elementary particles’. In that case there would be no need to take ‘elementary particles’ ontologically serious. Some newer results seem to make it almost impossible to maintain the wide-spread view that quantum field theory is just as well a particle as a field theory, despite of its supposedly misleading name. In particular the Reeh-Schlieder theorem and the Unruh effect seem to display features which show that QFT is essentially a field theory—although not in a straightforward classical sense. Further results like a no-go theorem by David Malament and, e.g., Robert Wald's research on QFT in curved space-time strongly support such a view, too.

Further Reading. One cluster of discussions on the philosophy of QFT was an investigation by Paul Teller and Michael Redhead on different formal descriptions of many particle systems containing identical particles, for instance in Redhead 1975, Redhead 1980, Redhead 1983, Teller 1983, Redhead 1988, Redhead & Teller 1991 and finally Teller 1995, which is the first systematic monograph on the philosophy of QFT. The anthology Brown & Harré 1988, Philosophical Foundations of Quantum Field Theory, was the first book to appear about this field of research. Sunny S. Auyang's book How is Quantum Field Theory Possible? (Auyang 1995) had fewer effects than Teller's in the first time, later it received more attention because of a new interest, first, in event ontology and, second, in the role of symmetries in connection with the discussion on gauge theories. Cao 1999 is an anthology with contributions by distinguished scholars from physics and philosophy (of physics) on a wide range of general and advanced special topics, e.g., alternative approaches, gauge invariance, renormalization, effective field theories, particle versus field ontology etc. The anthology Kuhlmann et al. 2002 brings philosophers and philosophers of physics together with a focus on ontological issues.

2. The Historial Development

2.1 The Early Development

The historical development of QFT is very instructive until the present day. Its first achievement, namely the quantization of the electromagnetic field is “still the paradigmatic example of a successful quantum field theory” Weinberg 1995. Ordinary QM cannot give an account of photons which constitute the paradigmatic case of relativistic ‘particles’. Since photons have the rest mass zero, and correspondingly travel in the vacuum at the velocity, naturally, of light c it is ruled out that a non-relativistic theory such as ordinary QM could give even an approximate description. Photons are implicitly contained in the emission and absorption processes which have to be postulated, for instance, when one of an atom's electrons makes a transition from a higher to a lower energy level or vice versa. However, only the formalism of QFT contains an explicit description of photons. Looking back one would say that most topics in the early development of quantum theory (1900–1927) were related with the interaction of radiation and matter and should be treated by quantum field theoretical methods. However, the way to quantum mechanics formulated by Dirac, Heisenberg and Schrödinger (1926/27) started from atomic spectra and did not rely very much on problems of radiation. As soon as the conceptual framework of quantum mechanics was developed, a small group of theoreticians immediately tried to extend the methods to electromagnetic fields. A good example is the famous three-man paper von M. Born, W. Heisenberg, and P. Jordan (1926). Especially P. Jordan was acquainted with the literature on light quanta and made important contributions to QFT. The basic analogy was that in QFT field quantities, i.e., the electric and magnetic field, should be represented by matrices in the same way as in QM position and momentum are represented by matrices. The ideas of QM were extended to systems having infinite degrees of freedom. The inception of QFT is usually dated 1927 with Dirac's famous paper Dirac 1927 on “The quantum theory of the emission and absorption of radiation.” Here Dirac coined the name quantum electrodynamics (QED) which is the part of QFT that has been developed first. Dirac supplied a systematic procedure for transferring the characteristic quantum phenomenon of discreteness of physical quantities from the quantum mechanical treatment of particles to a corresponding treatment of fields. Employing the quantum mechanical theory of the harmonic oscillator, Dirac gave a theoretical description of how photons appear in the quantization of the electromagnetic radiation field. Later, Dirac's procedure became a model for the quantization of other fields as well. During the following three years the first approaches to QFT were further developed. P. Jordan introduced creation operators for fields obeying Fermi statistics. For an elementary discussion of quantum statistics (Fermi and Bose), see the entry on quantum theory: identity and individuality.

So the methods of QFT could be applied to equations resulting from the quantum mechanical (field like) treatment of particles like the electron (e.g., Dirac equation). Schweber points out (Schweber 1994, p. 28) that the idea and procedure of that “second quantization” goes back to Jordan, in a number of papers from 1927 (see references in Schweber 1994, pp. 695f), while the expression itself was coined by Dirac. Some difficult problems concerning commutation relations, statistics and Lorentz invariance could be solved. The first comprehensive account of a general theory of quantum fields, in particular the method of canonical quantization, was presented in Heisenberg & Pauli 1929. Whereas the actual objects of Jordan's second quantization procedure are the coefficients of the normal modes of the field, Heisenberg & Pauli 1929 started with the fields themselves and subjected them to the canonical procedure. Heisenberg and Pauli thus established the basic structure of QFT which can be found in any introduction to QFT up to the present day. Fermi and Dirac, Fock and Podolski presented different formulations which played a heuristic role in the following years.

Quantum electrodynamics, the historical as well as systematical entrée to QFT, rests on two pillars (see, e.g., the short and lucid “Historical Introduction” of Scharf's original book Scharf 1995). The first pillar results from the quantization of the electromagmetic field, i.e., it is about photons as the quanta or quantized excitations of the electromagmetic field. As Weinberg points out the “photon is the only particle that was known as a field before it was detected as a particle” so that it is natural that QED began with the analysis of the radiation field (Weinberg 1995, p. 15). The second pillar of QED consists in the relativistic theory of the electron, with the Dirac equation in its centre.

The easiest way to quantize the electromagnetic (or: radiation) field consists of two steps. First, one Fourier analyses the vector potential of the classical field into normal modes (using periodic boundary conditions) corresponding to an infinite but denumerable number of degrees of freedom. Second, since each mode is described independently by a harmonic oscillator equation, one can apply the harmonic oscillator treatment from non-relativistic quantum mechanics to each single mode. The result for the Hamiltonian of the radiation field is

(2.1)    Hrad = ∑
k		 ∑
r		 hbarωk ( ar†(k)·ar(k) + 1/2 ),

where ar†(k) and ar(k) are operators which satisfy the following commutation relations

(2.2)     [ar(k), as†(k′)]   =   δrsδkk′
[ar(k), as(k′)]   =   [ar†(k), as†(k′)] = 0.

with the index r labeling the polarisation. These commutation relations imply that one is dealing with a bosonic field.

The operators ar†(k) and ar(k) as well as their product ar†(k)·ar(k) have interesting physical interpretations as so-called particle creation and annihilation operators. In order to see this one has to examine the eigenvalues of the operators

(2.3)   Nr(k) = ar†(k)·ar(k)

which are the essential parts in Hrad. Due to the commutation relations (2.2) one finds that the eigenvalues of Nr(k) are the integers nr(k) = 0, 1, 2, … and the corresponding eigenfunctions (up to a normalisation factor) are

(2.4) |nr(k)> = [ar†(k)]nr(k)|0>

where the right hand side means that ar†(k) operates nr(k) times on |0>, the state vector of the vacuum with no photons present. The interpretation of these results is parallel to the one of the harmonic oscillator. ar†(k) is interpreted as the creation operator of a photon with momentum hbark and energy hbarωk (and a polarisation which depends on r and k). That is, equation (2.4) can be understood in the following way. One gets a state with nr(k) photons of momentum hbark and energy hbarωk when the creation operator ar†(k) operates nr(k) times on the vacuum state |0>. Accordingly, Nr(k) is called the ‘number operator’ and nr(k) the ‘occupation number’ of the mode that is specified by k and r, i.e., this mode is occupied by nr(k) photons. Note that Pauli's exclusion principle is not violated since it only applies to fermions and not to bosons like photons. The corresponding interpretation for the annihilation operator ar(k) is parallel, when it operates on a state with a given number of photons this number is lowered by one.

It is a widespread view (see e.g., Ryder 1996, p. 131) that these results complete “the justification for interpreting N(k) as the number operator, and hence for the particle interpretation of the quantized theory.” This is a rash judgement, however. For instance, the question of localizability or at least approximate localizability is not even touched while it is certain that this is a pivotal criterion for something to be a particle. All that is established so far is a certain discreteness of physical quantities which is one feature of particles. However, this is not yet conclusive evidence for a particle interpretation of QFT. Recalling how various entities of forerunner theories, e.g., the single particle wave function, gained a very different meaning in QFT one should be extremely cautious to jump to one's conclusions when only certain aspects are rediscovered in QFT. It is not clear at this stage whether we are in fact talking about particles or about fundamentally different objects which only have this one feature of discreteness in common with particles.

2.2 The Emergence of Infinities

Quantum field theory started with a theoretical framework that was built in analogy to quantum mechanics. Although there was no unique and fully developed theory, quantum field theoretical tools could be applied to concrete processes. Examples are the scattering of radiation by free electrons (“Compton scattering”), the collision between relativistic electrons or the production of electron-positron pairs by photons. Calculations to the first order of approximation were quite successful, but most people working in the field thought that QFT still had to undergo a major change. On the one side some calculations of effects for cosmic rays clearly differed from measurements. On the other side and, from a theoretical point of view more threatening, calculations of higher orders of the perturbation series led to infinite results. The self-energy of the electron as well as vacuum fluctuations of the electromagnetic field seemed to be infinite. The perturbation expansions did not converge to a finite sum and even most individual terms were divergent.

The various forms of infinities suggested that the divergences were more than failures of specific calculations. Many people tried to avoid the divergences by formal tricks (truncating the integrals at some value of momentum, or even ignoring infinite terms) but such rules were not reliable, violated the requirements of relativity and were not considered as satisfactory. Some people came up with first ideas of coping with infinities by a redefinition of the parameters of the theory and using a measured finite value (for example of the charge of the electron) instead of the infinite ‘bare’ value (“renormalization”).

From the point of view of philosophy of science it is remarkable that these divergences did not give enough reason to discard the theory. The years from 1930 to the beginning of World War II were characterized by a variety of attitudes towards QFT. Some physicists tried to circumvent the infinities by more-or-less arbitrary prescriptions, others worked on transformations and improvements of the theoretical framework. Most of the theoreticians believed that QED would break down at high energies. There was also a considerable number of proposals in favour of alternative approaches. These proposals included changes in the basic concepts (e.g., negative probabilities), interactions at a distance instead of a field theoretical approach, and a methodological change to phenomenological methods that focusses on relations between observable quantities without an analysis of the microphysical details of the interaction (the so-called S-matrix theory where the basic elements are amplitudes for various scattering processes).

Despite the feeling that QFT was imperfect and lacking rigour, its methods were extended to new areas of applications. In 1933 Fermi's theory of the beta decay started with conceptions describing the emission and absorption of photons, transferred them to beta radiation and analyzed the creation and annihilation of electrons and neutrinos (weak interaction). Further applications of QFT outside of quantum electrodynamics succeeded in nuclear physics (strong interaction). In 1934 a new type of fields (scalar fields) described by the Klein-Gordon equation could be quantized (another example of “second quantization”). This new theory for matter fields could be applied a decade later when new particles, pions, were detected.

2.3 The Taming of Infinities

After the end of World War II reliable and effective methods for dealing with infinities in QFT were developed, namely coherent and systematic rules for performing relativistic field theoretical calculations, and a general renormalization theory. On three famous conferences between 1947 and 1949 developments in theoretical physics were confronted with relevant new experimental results. In the late forties there were two different ways to address the problem of divergences. One of these was discovered by Feynman, the other one (based on an operator formalism) by Schwinger and independently by Tomonaga. In 1949 Dyson showed that the two approaches are in fact equivalent. Thus, Freeman Dyson, Richard P. Feynman, Julian Schwinger and Sin-itiro Tomonaga became the inventors of renormalization theory. The most spectacular experimental successes of renormalization theory were the calculations of the anomalous magnetic moment of electron and the Lamb shift in the spectrum of hydrogen. These successes were so outstanding because the theoretical results were in better agreement with high precision experiments than anything in physics before.

The basic idea of renormalization is to avoid divergences that appear in physical predictions by shifting them into a part of the theory where they do not influence empirical propositions. Dyson could show that a rescaling of charge and mass (‘renormalization’) is sufficient to remove all divergences in QED to all orders of perturbation theory. In general, a QFT is called renormalizable, if all infinities can be absorbed into a redefinition of a finite number of coupling constants and masses. A consequence is that the physical charge and mass of the electron must be measured and cannot be computed from first principles. Perturbation theory gives well defined predictions only in renormalizable quantum field theories, and luckily QED, the first fully developed QFT belonged to the class of renormalizable theories. There are various technical procedures to renormalize a theory. One way is to cut off the integrals in the calculations at a certain value Λ of the momentum which is large but finite. This cut-off procedure is successful if, after taking the limit Λ → ∞, the resulting quantities are independent of Λ (Part II of Peskin & Schroeder 1995 gives an extensive description of renormalization).

Feynman's formulation of QED is of special interest from a philosophical point of view. His so-called space-time approach is visualized by the famous Feynman diagrams that look like depicting paths of particles. Feynman's method of calculating scattering amplitudes is based on the functional integral formulation of field theory (for an introduction to the theory and practice of Feynman diagrams see, e.g., chapter 4 in Peskin & Schroeder 1995). A set of graphical rules can be derived so that the probability of a specific scattering process can be calculated by drawing a diagram of that process and then using the diagram to write down the mathematical expressions for calculating its amplitude. The diagrams provide an effective way to organize and visualize the various terms in the perturbation series, and they seem to display the flow of electrons and photons during the scattering process. External lines in the diagrams represent incoming and outgoing particles, internal lines are connected with ‘virtual particles’ and vertices with interactions. Each of these graphical elements is associated with mathematical expressions that contribute to the amplitude of the respective process. The diagrams are part of Feynman's very efficient and elegant algorithm for computing the probability of scattering processes. The idea of particles travelling from one point to another was heuristically useful in constructing the theory, and moreover, this intuition is useful for concrete calculations. Nevertheless, an analysis of the theoretical justification of the space-time approach shows that its success does not imply that particle paths have to be taken seriously. General arguments against a particle interpretation of QFT clearly exclude that the diagrams represent paths of particles in the interaction area. Feynman himself was not particularly interested in ontological questions.

In the beginning of the 1950s QED became a reliable theory which had left behind the preliminary status. It took two decades from writing down the first equations until QFT could be applied to interesting physical problems in a systematic way. The new developments made it possible to apply QFT to new particles and new interactions. In the following decades QFT was extended to describe not only the electromagnetic force but also weak and strong interaction so that new Lagrangians had to be found which contain new classes of ‘particles’ or quantum fields. The research aimed at a more comprehensive theory of matter and in the end at a unified theory of all interactions. New theoretical concepts had to be introduced, mainly connected with non-Abelian gauge theories (see below, section 2.3) and spontaneous symmetry breaking. See also the entry on symmetry and symmetry breaking. Today there are trustworthy theories of the strong, weak, and electromagnetic interactions of elementary particles which have a similar structure as QED. A combined theory associated with the gauge group SU(3) otimes SU(2) otimes U(1) is considered as ‘the standard model’ of elementary particle physics which was achieved by Glashow, Weinberg and Salam in 1962. According to the standard model there are three families of quarks and leptons, each of them containing 15 particles/fields with spin 1/2 (for example various quarks, the electron and its neutrino, or the muon and its neutrino). In addition it contains terms for the photon and other spin 1 particles/fields describing the forces between quarks and leptons. Alltogether there is good agreement to experimental data, for example the masses of W+ and W− bosons (detected in 1983) confirmed the theoretical prediction within one per cent deviation.

Further Reading. The first chapter in Weinberg 1995 is a very good short description of the earlier history of QFT. Detailed accounts of the historical development of QFT can be found, e.g., in Darrigol 1986, Schweber 1994 and Cao 1997a. Various historical and conceptual studies of the standard model are gathered in Hoddeson et al. 1997 and of renormalization theory in Brown 1993.

3. The Basic Structure of the Standard Formulation

3.1 The Lagrangian Formulation of QFT

The crucial step towards quantum field theory is in some respects analogous to the corresponding quantization in quantum mechanics by imposing the commutation relations. Its starting point is the classical Lagrangian formulation of mechanics, which is a so-called analytical formulation as opposed to the standard version of Newtonian mechanics. A generalized notion of momentum (the conjugate or canonical momentum) is defined by setting p = ∂L/∂q̇, where L is the Lagrange function L = T − V (T is the kinetic energy and V the potential) and q̇ ≡ dq/dt. This definition can be motivated by looking at the special case of a Lagrange function with a potential V which depends only on the position so that (using Cartesian coordinates) ∂L/∂ẋ = (∂/∂ẋ)·(mẋ2/2) = mẋ = px. Under these conditions the generalized momentum coincides with the usual mechanical momentum. In classical Lagrangian field theory one associates with the given field φ a second field, namely the conjugate field

(3.1)   π = ∂scriptL/∂φ̇

where scriptL is a Lagrangian density. The field φ and its conjugate field π are the direct analogues of the canonical coordinate q and the generalized (canonical or conjugate) momentum p in classical mechanics of point particles.

In both cases, QM and QFT, requiring that the canonical variables satisfy certain commutation relations implies that the basic quantities become operator valued. From a physical point of view this shift implies a restriction of possible measurement values for physical quantities some (but not all) of which can have their values only in discrete steps now. In QFT the canonical commutation relations for a field φ and the corresponding conjugate field π are

(3.2)   [φ(x,t), π(y,t)] = iδ3(x − y)
[φ(x,t), φ(y,t)] = [π(x,t), π(y,t)] = 0

which are equal-time commutation relations, i.e., the commutators always refer to fields at the same time. It is not obvious that the equal-time commutation relations are Lorentz invariant but one can formulate a manifestly covariant form of the canonical commutation relations. If the field to be quantized is not a bosonic field, like the Klein-Gordon field or the electromagnetic field, but a fermionic field, like the Dirac field for electrons one has to use anticommutation relations.

In very loose terms, the operator valuedness of quantum fields means that to each space-time point (x,t) a field value φ(x,t) is assigned which is an operator. This is the fundamental difference to classical fields because an operator valued quantum field φ(x,t) does not by itself correspond to definite values of a physical quantity like the strength of the electromagnetic field. On this background, Teller has argued in Teller 1995 that the field interpretation of QFT is inappropriate since the alleged fields in QFT are not to be interpreted as physical fields with definite values of some sort which are assigned to space-time points, like in the case of the classical electromagnetic field. Rather, quantum fields are what Teller calls ‘determinables’ (p. 95), as it becomes manifest by the fact that quantum fields are described by mappings from space-time points to operators. Operators are mathematical entities which are defined by how they act on something. They do not represent definite values of quantities but they specify what can be measured, therefore Teller's expression ‘determinables’. (Below it will be discussed why this talk in terms of a field at a point has to be refined using the notion of a smeared field φ(f).)

While there are close analogies between quantization in QM and in QFT there are also important differences. Whereas the commutation relations in QM refer to a quantum object with three degrees of freedom, so that one has a set of 15 equations, the commutation relations in QFT do in fact comprise an infinite number of equations, namely for each 4-tuple (x,t) there is a new set of commutation relations and there is, of course, a continuous set of space-time points (x,t). This infinite number of degrees of freedom embodies the field character of quantum field theory.

Regarding differences between QM and QFT it is important to realize that the operator valued field φ(x,t) in QFT is not analogous to the wavefunction ψ(x,t) in QM, i.e., the quantum mechanical state in its position representation. Although in the development of QFT there is a continuity from the wave function, i.e., the quantum mechanical state in its position representation, to the field in QFT, it would be a misconception to understand these two quantities as analogues. Here, the ontologically relevant formal setting has changed in the transition from QM to QFT. While the wavefunction in QM is acted upon by observables, i.e., by operators, it is the (operator valued) field in QFT which itself acts on the space of states, i.e., on the states which are associated with the quantum field. In a certain sense one can say that the single particle wave functions have been transformed, via their reinterpretation as operator valued quantum fields, into observables. This step is sometimes called ‘second quantization’ because the single particle wave equations in relativistic QM already came about by a quantization procedure, e.g., in the case of the Klein-Gordon equation by replacing position and momentum by the corresponding quantum mechanical operators. Afterwards the solutions to these single particle wave equations, which are states in relativistic QM, are considered as classical fields which can be subjected to the canonical quantization procedure of QFT. The term ‘second quantization’ has often been critized partly because it blurs the important fact that the single particle wave function φ in relativistic QM and the operator valued quantum field φ are fundamentally different kinds of entities despite their connection in the context of discovery.

Summing up one can say that although in both, QM and QFT, the two fundamental irreducible kinds of entities are states on the one side and observables on the other side this fact is overshadowed by two confusing aspects in a comparison of QM and QFT. First, quantum fields which one expects to be somehow physically concrete like classical fields are on the side of observables although, as far as the development of theories is concerned, they are the successors of states (in their position representation, namely wave functions), e.g., in the Klein-Gordon equation of relativistic QM as described above. The second confusing aspect is that states are constantly mentioned in QM, whereas most of QFT is about quantum fields. States, which are comparatively abstract entities in QFT with no immediate spatio-temporal meaning, seem to be an appendage. Nevertheless, both states and observables are equally important in QM and QFT as the two fundamental kinds of entities.

3.2 Interaction

Up to this point, the aim was to develop a free field theory. Doing so does not only neglect interaction with other particles (fields), it is even unrealistic for one free particle because it interacts with the field that it generates itself. For the description of interactions—such as scattering in particle colliders—we need certain extensions and modifications of the formalism as so far exposed. The immediate contact between scattering experiments and QFT is given by the scattering or S-matrix which contains all the relevant predictive information about, e.g., scattering cross sections. In order to calculate the S-matrix the interaction Hamiltonian is needed. The Hamiltonian can in turn be derived from the Lagrangian density by means of the so-called Legendre transformation.

In order to discuss interactions one introduces a new representation, the so-called interaction picture which is an alternative to the Schrödinger and the Heisenberg picture. For the interaction picture one splits up the Hamiltonian, which is the generator of time-translations, into two parts H = H0 + Hint, where H0 describes the free system, i.e., without interaction, and gets absorbed in the definition of the fields and Hint is the interaction part of the Hamiltonian, or short the ‘interaction Hamiltonian’. Using the interaction picture is advantageous because the equations of motion as well as, under certain conditions, the commutations relations are the same for interacting fields as for free fields. Therefore, various results that were established for free fields can still be used in the case of interacting fields. The central instrument for the description of interaction is again the S-matrix, which expresses the connection between in and out states by specifying the transition amplitudes. In QED, for instance, a state |in> describes one particular configuration of electrons, positrons and photons, i.e., it describes how many of these particles there are and which momenta, spins and polarizations they have before the interaction. The S-matrix supplies the probability that this state goes over to a particular |out> state, e.g., that a particular counter responds after the interaction. Such probabilities can be checked in experiments.

The canonical formalism of QFT as introduced in the previous section is only applicable in the case of free fields since the inclusion of interaction leads to infinities (see the historical part). For this reason perturbation theory makes up a large part of most publications on QFT. The importance of perturbative methods is understandable realizing that they establish the immediate contact between theory and experiment. Although the techniques of perturbation theory have become ever more sophisticated it is somewhat disturbing that perturbative methods could not be avoided even in principle. One reason for this unease is that perturbation theory is felt to be rather a matter of (highly sophisticated) craftsmanship than of understanding nature. Accordingly, the corpus of perturbative methods plays a small role in the philosophical investigations of QFT. What does matter, however, is in which sense the consideration of interaction effects the general framework of QFT. An overview is given in Section 4.1 (“Perturbation Theory—Philosophy and Examples”) of Peskin & Schroeder 1995.

3.3 Gauge Invariance

Some theories are distinguished by the mathematical property of gauge invariance which means that transformations, so-called gauge transformations, of certain terms do not change the observable quantities. The requirement of gauge invariance has the mathematical advantage that it provides an elegant way to introduce terms for interacting fields. Moreover, requiring gauge invariance plays an important role for the selection of theories. The prime example of an intrinsically gauge invariant theory is the theory of the electromagnetic field. It is well-known from the classical theory that Maxwell's equations can be stated in terms of the vector potential A and the scalar potential φ or in terms of the 4-vector potential Aμ = (φ, A). The link to the electric field E(x,t) and the magnetic field B(x,t) is given by

(3.3)   B = del × A
E = −(∂A/∂t) − delφ

or covariantly

(3.4)   Fμν = ∂μ Aμ − ∂ν Aμ

where Fμν is the electromagnetic field tensor. The important point in the present context is that given the identification (3.3) or (3.4), there remains a certain flexibility or freedom in the choice of A and φ, or Aμ. In order to see that, consider the so-called gauge transformations

(3.5)   A → A − delψ
φ → φ + ∂χ/∂t

or covariantly

(3.6)   Aμ → Aμ + ∂μχ

where χ is a scalar function (of space and time or of space-time) which can be chosen arbitrarily. Inserting the transformed potential(s) into equation(s) (3.3), or (3.4), one can see that the electric field E and the magnetic field B, or covariantly the electromagnetic field tensor Fμν, are not effected by a gauge transformation of the potential(s). Since only the electric field E and the magnetic field B, and quantities constructed from them, are observable, whereas the vector potential itself is not, nothing physical seems to be changed by a gauge transformation because it leaves E and B unaltered. Note that gauge invariance is a kind of symmetry that does not come about by space-time transformations.

In order to link the notion of gauge invariance to the Lagrangian formulation of QFT one needs a more general form of gauge transformations which operates on the field operator φ and which is supplied by

(3.7)   φ → e−iΛφ
φ* → eiΛφ*

where Λ is an arbitrary real constant. Equations (3.7) describe a global gauge transformation in contrast to a local gauge transformation

(3.8)   φ(x) → e−iα(x)φ(x)

which can vary with x. The requirement of invariance under a local gauge transformation is essential for finding the equations describing fundamental interaction. Take for example the Lagrangian for a free electron. The requirement that the Lagrangian should be locally invariant under the same type of transformation can only be fulfilled by introducing additional terms. The form of these terms is determined by the symmetry requirement, which results in the introduction of the electromagnetic field. In a sense, the electromagnetic field is a consequence of the local symmetry of the Lagrangian for the electron.

This procedure can be generalized to more complex transformations (for example referring to mixing the components of field operators) and new interactions. By requiring local gauge invariance additional fields can be introduced. These additional fields describe the interaction between the original fields. The gauge principle provides a general schema for introducing interaction by constructing gauge field theories. To this end one starts with a Lagrangian for a matter field and derives the interaction by introducing exactly those fields that make the Lagrangian invariant under a relevant local gauge transformation. It seems that all fundamental forces can be described by such local gauge field theories.

Gauge symmetry plays a crucial role in determining the dynamics of the theory since the nature of gauge transformation determines the possible interaction. The structure of these transformations are characterized by special mathematical groups: U(1) for QED, SU(2) otimes U(1) for electroweak interaction, SU(3) for strong interaction. The relations between these groups are exploited in programs for the unification of the fundamental types of interaction. There is also a strong analogy to general relativity where a local gauge symmetry is associated with the gravitational field. From a more technical point of view gauge symmetries are important tools in proofs of renormalizability. The upshot is that the fulfillment of gauge invariance has an importance for the selection of theories which makes gauge invariance a player in the same league as Lorentz invariance. Since gauge invariance plays a pivotal role in the discovery of quantum field theories it is a paradigm case for how a rich mathematical structure can help in the construction of theories.

General introductions to gauge theories can be found in Cao 1997a and Schweber 1994. Auyang emphasizes the general conceptual significance of invariance principles in her book Auyang 1995 while Redhead 2002 as well as Martin 2002 focus specifically on gauge symmetries. Lyre 2004b is a study of the significance of gauge theories for the debate on structural realism, with a related paper Lyre 2004a in English. The ontological significance of gauge potentials is discussed in particular with respect to the Aharanov-Bohm effect, e.g., in Healey 2001.

3.4 Effective Field Theories and Renormalization

In the 1970s a program emerged in which the theories of the standard model of elementary particle physics are considered as effective field theories (EFTs) which have a common quantum field theoretical framework. EFTs describe relevant phenomena only in a certain domain since the Lagrangian contains only those terms that describe particles which are relevant for the respective range of energy. EFTs are inherently approximative and change with the range of energy considered. EFTs are only applicable on a certain energy scale, i.e., they only describe phenomena in a certain range of energy. Influences from higher energy processes contribute to average values but they cannot be described in detail. This procedure has no severe consequences since the details of low-energy theories are largely decoupled from higher energy processes. Both domains are only connected by altered coupling constants and the renormalization group describes how the coupling constants depend on the energy.

The main idea of EFTs is that theories, i.e., in particular the Langrangians, depend on the energy of the phenomena which are analysed. The physics changes by switching to a different energy scale, e.g., new particles can be created if a certain energy threshold is exceeded. The dependence of theories from the energy scale distinguishes QFT from, e.g., Newton's theory of gravitation where the same law applies to an apple as well as to the moon. Nevertheless, laws from different energy scales are not completely independent from each other. A central aspect of considerations about this dependence are the consequences of higher energy processes on the low-energy scale.

On this background a new attitude towards renormalization developed in the 1970s which revitalizes earlier ideas that divergences result from neglecting unknown processes of higher energies. Low-energy behaviour is thus affected by higher energy processes. Since higher energies correspond to smaller distances this dependence is to be expected from an atomistic point of view. According to the reductionistic program the dynamics of constituents on the microlevel should determine processes on the macrolevel, i.e., here the low-energy processes. However, as, for instance hydrodynamics shows, in practice theories from different levels are not quite as closely connected because a law which is applicable on the macrolevel can be largely independent from microlevel details. For this reason analogies with statistical mechanics play an important role in the discussion about EFTs. The basic idea of this new story about renormalization is that the influences of higher energy processes are localisable in a few structural properties which can be captured by an adjustment of parameters. “In this picture, the presence of infinities in quantum field theory is neither a disaster, nor an asset. It is simply a reminder of a practical limitation—we do not know what happens at distances much smaller than those we can look at directly.” (Georgi 1989, p. 456) This new attitude supports the view that renormalization is the appropriate answer to the change of fundamental interactions when the QFT is applied to processes on different energy scales. The price one has to pay is that EFTs are only valid in a limited domain and should be considered as approximations to better theories on higher energy scales. This prompts the important question whether there is a last fundamental theory in this tower of EFTs which supercede each other with rising energies. Some people conjecture that this deeper theory could be a string theory, i.e., a theory which is not a field theory any more. Or should one ultimately expect from physics theories that they are only valid as approximations and in a limited domain?

3.5 String Theories

Up to now string theory is the most promising candidate for bridging the gap between QFT and general relativity theory, thus supplying a unified theory of all natural forces, including gravitation. The basic idea of string theory is not to take particles as fundamental objects but strings which are very small but extended in one dimension. This assumption has the pivotal consequence that strings interact on an extended distance and not at a point. This difference between string theory and standard QFT is essential because it is the reason why string theory also encompasses the gravitational force which cannot be treated in the framework of QFT. Gravitation is so hard to be reconciled with QFT because the typical length scale of the gravitational force is very small, namely at Planck scale, so that the quantum field theoretical assumption of point-like interaction leads to untreatable infinities. To put in another way, gravitation becomes significant (in particular in comparison to strong interaction) exactly where QFT is most severely endangered by infinite quantities. The extended interaction of strings brings it about that such infinities can be avoided. In contrast to the entities in standard quantum physics strings are not characterized by quantum numbers but only by their geometrical and dynamical properties. Nevertheless, “macroscopically” strings look like quantum particles with quantum numbers. A basic geometrical distinction is the one between open strings, i.e., strings with two ends, and closed strings which are like bracelets. The central dynamical property of strings is their mode of excitation, i.e., how they vibrate.

Reservations about string theory are mostly due to the lack of testability since it seems that there are no empirical consequences which could be tested by the methods which are, at least up to now, available to us. The raeson for this “problem” is that the length scale of strings is in the average the same as the one of quantum gravity, namely the Planck length of approximately 10−33 centimeters which lies far beyond the accessibility of feasible particle experiments. But there are also other peculiar features of string theory which might be hard to swallow. One of them is the fact that string theory implies that space-time has 10, 11 or even 26 dimensions. In order to explain the appearance of only four space-time dimensions string theory assumes that the other dimensions are somehow folded away or “compactified” so that they are no longer visible. An intuitive idea can be gained by thinking of a macaroni which is a tube, i.e., a two-dimensional piece of pasta rolled together, but which looks from the distance like a one-dimensional string.

Despite of the problems of string theory, physicists do not abandon this project, partly because there seem to be no better candidates for a reconciliation of quantum physics and general relativity theory with the possible exception of the so-called “loop quantum gravity” (see the entry on quantum gravity). Correspondingly, string theory has also received some attention within the philosophy of physics community in recent years. One philosophical investigation of string theory is Weingard 2001 in Callender & Huggett 2001, an anthology with further related articles. Another more recent study is Dawid 2003 (see the Other Internet Resources section below). Dawid argues that string theory has significant consequences for the philosophical debate about realism, namely that it speaks against the plausibility of anti-realistic positions.

Two of the standard introductory monographs to string theory are Polchinski 2000 and Kaku 1999. A very successful popular introduction is Greene 1999. An interactive website with a nice elementary introduction is ‘Stringtheory.com’ (see the Other Internet Resources section below).

4. Alternative Approaches

4.1 Deficiencies of the Standard Formulation of QFT

From the 1930s onwards the problem of infinities as well as the potentially heuristic status of the Lagrangian formulation of QFT stimulated the search for reformulations in a concise and eventually axiomatic manner. A number of further aspects intensified the unease about the standard formulation of QFT. The first one is that quantities like total charge, total energy or total momentum of a field are unobservable since their measurement would have to take place in the whole universe. Accordingly, quantities which refer to infinitely extended regions of space-time should not appear among the observables of the theory as they do in the standard formulation of QFT. Another problematic feature of standard QFT is the idea that QFT is about field values at points of space-time. The mathematical aspect of the problem is that a field at a point, φ(x), is not an operator in a Hilbert space. The physical counterpart of the problem is that it would require an infinite amount of energy to measure a field at a point of spacetime. One way to handle this situation—and one of the starting points for axiomatic reformulations of QFT—is not to consider fields at a point but instead fields which are smeared out in the vicinity of that point using certain functions, so-called test functions. The result is a smeared field φ(f) = ∫φ(x)f(x)dx with supp(f) ⊂ calO, where supp(f) is the support of the test function f and calO is a bounded open region in Minkowski space-time.

The third important problem for standard QFT which prompted reformulations is the existence of inequivalent representations. In the context of quantum mechanics, Schrödinger, Dirac, Jordan and von Neumann realized that Heisenberg's matrix mechanics and Schrödinger's wave mechanics are just two (unitarily) equivalent representations of the same underlying abstract structure, i.e., an abstract Hilbert space scriptH and linear operators acting on this space. In 1931 von Neumann gave a detailed proof (of a conjecture by Stone) that the canonical commutation relations (CCRs) for position coordinates and their conjugate momentum coordinates in configuration space fix the representation of these two sets of operators in Hilbert space up to unitary equivalence (von Neumann's uniqueness theorem). This means that the specification of the purely algebraic CCRs suffices to describe a particular physical system. In quantum field theory, however, von Neumann's uniqueness theorem looses its validity since here one is dealing with an infinite number of degrees of freedom. Now one is confronted with a multitude of inequivalent irreducible representations of the CCRs and it is not obvious what this means physically and how one should cope with it.

4.2 The Algebraic Point of View

The described situation is the background for the establishment of algebraic reformulations of QFT. According to the algebraic point of view algebras of observables rather than observables themselves should be taken as the basic entities in the mathematical description of quantum physics. In the forties the mathematician i.e., Segal postulated (Segal 1947a, 1947b) that the C*-algebra generated by all bounded operators should be the basic entity in the mathematical description of physics. It turned out that the adoption of an algebraic point of view could be the appropriate framework in order to handle all the above-mentioned problems of standard QFT, the representation problem for instance. In standard QM the algebraic point of view in terms of C*-algebras makes no notable difference to the usual Hilbert space formulation since the Hilbert space representation and the C*-algebra formalism are equivalent. However, in QFT this is no longer the case as described above. Since in QFT one is dealing with an infinite number of degrees of freedom there are unitarily inequivalent irreducible representations of a C*-algebra. Sticking to the usual Hilbert space formulation thus means to make an implicit choice of one particular representation that is not equivalent to other available representations. Segal proposed to take one single C*-algebra as the basic element of the mathematical description of a quantum physical system and he dismissed the availability of inequivalent representations as irrelevant to physics. Against this approach Haag, the most outstanding advocate of algebraic quantum field theory (AQFT), argued that inequivalent representations can be understood physically by a revision of Segal's approach. The decisive idea is not to take individual C*-algebras as the basic ingredients of the description but rather a so-called net of algebras (see below) since the relation between various algebras itself represents important physical information. Another point where algebraic formulations are advantageous derives from the fact that two quantum fields are physically equivalent when they generate the same algebras of local observables. Such equivalent quantum field theories belong to the same so-called Borchers class which entails that they lead to the same S-matrix. As Haag stresses, in Haag 1996, fields are only an instrument in order to “coordinatize” observables, more precisely, in order to coordinatize the sets of observables with respect to different finite space-time regions (the so-called net of local algebras in AQFT). The choice of a field system is to a certain degree conventional, namely as long as it belongs to the same Borchers class. From this point of view it is more appropriate to consider these algebras as the fundamental entities in QFT rather than quantum fields.

In the fifties there was a strong tendency, in physics as well as in other fields, to reformulate grown theories in an axiomatic manner, partly in order to remove ad hoc features. A very prominent early attempt to axiomatise QFT is Arthur Wightman's field axiomatics. Wightman imposed axioms on polynomial algebras cal P(cal O) of smeared fields, i.e., sums of products of smeared fields. A crucial point of Wightman's approach is the replacement of the mapping x → φ(x), which supposedly expresses what is meant by a field, by the mapping cal O → cal P(cal O) from finite space-time regions cal O to cal P(cal O). Wightman's smeared out field operators are unbounded which makes the approach cumbersome from a mathematical point of view and this is one of the differences to the approach I will introduce next where only bounded operators are considered.

Algebraic Quantum Field Theory (AQFT) is arguably the most successful attempt to reformulate QFT in an axiomatic manner. AQFT originated in the late fifties by the work of Rudolf Haag and quickly advanced in collaboration with Huzihiro Araki and Daniel Kastler. AQFT itself exists in two versions, concrete AQFT (Haag-Araki) and abstract AQFT (Haag-Kastler). The concrete approach uses von Neumann algebras (or W*-algebras), the abstract one C*-algebras. The adjective ‘abstract’ refers to the fact that in this approach the algebras are characterized in an abstract fashion and not by explicitly using operators on a Hilbert space. In standard QFT, the CCRs together with the field equations can be used for the same purpose, i.e., an abstract characterization. One common aim of these axiomatisations of QFT is to avoid the usual approximations in standard QFT. Trying to do this in a strictly axiomatic way, however, they only get ‘reformulations’ which are not as rich as standard QFT from a physical point of view. The “algebraic approach […] has given us a frame and a language not a theory” as Haag concedes in Haag 1996 with respect to AQFT.

4.3 Basic Ideas of AQFT

One of the main traits and possibly the most unusual one of AQFT is that so-called nets of algebras are seen as the primary objects of study. The idea is that the physical information in quantum field theories is not contained in individual algebras but in the mapping cal O → cal A(cal O) from spacetime regions cal O to algebras cal A(cal O) of local observables where the cal O's are open and bounded regions in Minkowski spacetime. Since only finite regions are considered, the algebras are called local algebras. Physically, the elements of an algebra cal A(cal O) are seen as representing operations that can be performed in the region cal O that is associated with the algebra. The crucial point is that it is not necessary to specify observables explicitly in order to fix physically meaningful quantities. The very way how algebras of local observables are linked to spacetime regions is sufficient to supply observables with physical significance. It is the partition of the so-called algebra cal Aloc of all local observables into subalgebras which contains physical information about the observables, i.e., it is the net structure of algebras which matters. The claim is that the allocation itself of observable algebras to finite space-time regions suffices to account for the physical meaning of observables. It is not necessary to start with any such information explicitly.

The physical justification for this approach consists in the recognition that the experimental data for QFT are exclusively space-time localization properties of microobjects from which other properties are inferred. The Stern-Gerlach experiment is an illuminating example. All one gets in this experiment are certain space-time distributions of dots of detected particles which originated from a particle source and hit a photographic plate. Only in a second step one recognices particles with certain spin directions after having passed an inhomogeneous magnetic field. This example might help to imagine that space-time localisation can specify or encode all other physical properties.

Physically the most important notion of AQFT is the principle of locality which has an external as well as an internal aspect. The external aspect is the fact that AQFT considers only observables connected with finite regions of space-time and not global observables like the total charge or the total energy momentum vector which refer to infinite space-time regions. This approach was motivated by the operationalistic view that QFT is a statistical theory about local measurement outcomes with all the experimental information coming from measurements in finite space-time regions. Accordingly everything is expressed in terms of local algebras of observables. The internal aspect of locality is that there is a constraint on the observables of such local algebras: All observables of a local algebra connected with a space-time region cal O are required to commute with all observables of another algebra which is associated with a space-time region cal O′ that is space-like separated from cal O. This principle of (Einstein) causality is the main relativistic ingredient of AQFT.

The basic structure upon which the assumptions or conditions of AQFT are imposed are local observables, i.e., self-adjoint elements in local (non-commutative) von Neumann-algebras, and physical states, which are identified as positive, linear, normalized functionals which map elements of local algebras to real numbers. States can thus be understood as assignments of expectation values to observables. One can group the assumptions of AQFT into relativistic axioms, such as locality and covariance, general physical assumptions, like isotony and spectrum condition, and finally technical assumptions which are closely related to the mathematical formulation.

As a reformulation of QFT, AQFT is expected to reproduce the main phenomena of QFT, in particular properties which are characteristic of it being a field theory, like the existence of antiparticles, internal quantum numbers, the relation of spin and statistics, etc. That this aim could not be achieved within AQFT on a purely axiomatic basis is partly due to the fact that the connection between the respective key concepts of AQFT and QFT, i.e., observables and quantum fields, is not sufficiently clear. It turned out that the main link between the theory of local observables and the quantum fields of standard QFT is the notion of superselection. Superselection rules are certain restrictions on the set of all observables and allow for classification schemes in terms of permanent or essential properties.

Comprehensive introductions to AQFT are provided by the monographs Haag 1996 and Horuzhy 1990 as well as the overview articles Haag & Kastler 1964, Roberts 1990 and Buchholz 1998. Early pioneering monographs on axiomatic QFT are Streater & Wightman 1964 and Bogolubov et al. 1975. Mathematical aspects are emphasized in Bratteli & Robinson 1979.

It is only since the second half of the eighties that AQFT came into the focus of the philosophy of physics community. Some of the most fruitful discussions were stimulated by reexaminations of physical theorems from the sixties and seventies, in particular the Reeh-Schlieder theorem. Further results of interest are Haag's theorem and a lemma by Borchers. The properties of the relativistic vacuum often play a central role in these discussions. Cf., e.g., Redhead 1995a, Redhead 1995b and the monograph, The Philosophy of Vacuum (Saunders & Brown 1991). A mayor reason for this interest is that the vacuum displays features which seem to be in conflict with standard ontological conceptions about what things are and how things and properties are related to each other. Some central issues in the philosophical debate about AQFT are questions about locality, localization and causality (e.g., Saunders 1988, Redhead & Wagner 1998, Ruetsche 2003, Redei & Summers 2002 as well as numerous fine papers by Rob Clifton, collected in Butterfield & Halvorson 2004).

5. Philosophical Issues

5.1 Ontology

Ontology is concerned with the most general features, entities and structures of being. One can pursue ontology in a very general sense or with respect to a particular theory or a particular part or aspect of the world. With respect to the ontology of QFT one is tempted to more or less dismiss ontological enquiries and to adopt the following straightforward view. There are two groups of fundamental fermionic matter constituents, two groups of bosonic force carriers and four (including gravitation) kinds of interactions. As satisfying as this answer might first appear, the ontological questions are, in a sense, not even touched. Saying that, for instance the down quark is a fundamental constituent of our material world is the starting point rather than the end of the (philosophical) search for an ontology of QFT. The main question is what kind of entity, e.g., the down quark is. The answer does not depend on whether we think of down quarks or muon neutrinos since the sought features are much more general than those ones which constitute the difference between down quarks or muon neutrinos. The relevant questions are of a different type. What are particles at all? Can quantum particles be legitimately understood as particles any more, even in the broadest sense, when we take, e.g., their localization properties into account? How can one spell out what a field is and can “quantum fields” in fact be understood as fields? Could it be more appropriate not to think of, e.g., quarks, whatever they are, as the most fundamental entities at all, but rather of properties or processes or events?

5.1.1 The Particle Interpretation of QFT

Many of the creators of QFT can be found in one of the two camps regarding the question whether particles or fields should be given priority in understanding QFT. While Dirac, the later Heisenberg, Feynman, and Wheeler opted in favor of particles, Pauli, the early Heisenberg, Tomonaga and Schwinger put fields first (see Landsman 1996). Today, there are a number of arguments which prepare the ground for a proper discussion beyond mere preferences.

It seems almost impossible to think of QFT without thinking of particles which are accelerated and scattered in colliders. Nevertheless, it is this very interpretation which has the most fully developed arguments against it. There still is the option to say that our classical concept of a particle is too narrow and that we have to loosen some of its constraints. Even in classical corpuscular theories of matter the concept of an (elementary) particle is not as unproblematic as one might expect. For instance, if the whole charge of a particle was contracted to a point, an infinite amount of energy would be stored in this particle since the repulsive forces become infinitely large when two charges with the same sign are brought together. The so-called self energy of a point particle is infinite.

Probably the most immediate trait of particles is their discreteness. Particles are countable individuals in contrast to a liquid or a mass. Obviously this characteristic alone cannot constitute a sufficient condition for being a particle since there are other things which are countable as well without being particles, e.g., money or maxima and minima of the standing wave of a vibrating string. It seems that the so-called primitive thisness or haecceity is missing to make up a sufficient condition for a particle, i.e., it must be possible to say that it is this or that particle which has been counted in order to account for the fundamental difference between ups and downs in a wave pattern and particles particles (see also the entry on quantum theory: identity and individuality). In Teller 1995 primitive thisness as well as other possible features of the particle concept are discussed in comparison to classical concepts of fields and waves as well as in comparison to the concept of field quanta. A critical discussion of Teller's reasoning can be found in Seibt 2002. There is still another feature which is commonly taken to be pivotal for the particle concept, namely that particles are localizable in space. While it is clear from classical physics already that the requirement of localizability need not refer to point-like localization, it will turn out later in this section that even localizability in an arbitrarily large but still finite region can be a strong condition for quantum particles.

Eventually, there are some potential ingredients of the particle concept which are explicitly opposed to the corresponding (and therefore opposite) features of the field concept. Whereas it is a core characteristic of a field that it is a system with an infinite number of degrees of freedom, the very opposite holds for particles. A particle can for instance be referred to by the specification of the coordinates x(t) that pertain, e.g., to its center of mass—presupposing impenetrability. A further feature of the particle concept is connected to the last point and again explicitly in opposition to the field concept. In a pure particle ontology the interaction between remote particles can only be understood as an action at a distance. In contrast to that, in a field ontology, or a combined ontology of particles and fields, local action is implemented by mediating fields. Finally, classical particles are massive and impenetrable, again in contrast to (classical) fields.

The concept of particles has been evolving through history in accordance with the latest scientific theories. Therefore, considering the tenability of a particle interpretation for QFT is not quite such a straightforward issue as one might think. Confronted with features of QFT that are in conflict with the above-mentioned features of particles one can either abandon the particle interpretation or one adjusts the particle concept, as has been done before.

Wigner's famous analysis of the Poincaré group, Wigner 1939, is often assumed to provide a definition of elementary particles. The main idea of Wigner's approach is the supposition that each irreducible (projective) representation of the relevant symmetry group yields the state space of one kind of elementary physical system, where the prime example is an elementary particle which has the more restrictive property of being structureless. The physical justification for linking up irreducible representations with elementary systems is the requirement that “there must be no relativistically invariant distinction between the various states of the system” (Newton & Wigner 1949). In other words the state space of an elementary system shall have no internal structure with respect to relativistic transformations. Put more technically, the state space of an elementary system must not contain any relativistically invariant subspaces, i.e., it must be the state space of an irreducible representation of the relevant invariance group. If the state space of an elementary system had relativistically invariant subspaces then it would be appropriate to associate these subspaces with elementary systems. The requirement that a state space has to be relativistically invariant means that starting from any of its states it must be possible to get to all the other states by superposition of those states which result from relativistic transformations of the state one started with. The main part of Wigner's analysis consists in finding and classifying all the irreducible representations of the Poincaré group. Doing that involves finding relativistically invariant quantities that serve to classify the irreducible representations. Eugene Wigner's pioneering identification of types of particles with irreducible unitary representations of the Poincaré group has been exemplary until the present, as it is emphasized, e.g., in Buchholz 1994.

Regarding the question whether Wigner has supplied a definition of particles one can say that although Wigner has in fact found a highly valuable and fruitful classification of particles his analysis does not contribute very much to the question what a particle is and whether a given theory can be interpreted in terms of particles. What Wigner has given is rather a conditional answer. If relativistic quantum mechanics can be interpreted in terms of particles then the possible types of particles correspond to irreducible unitary representations of the Poincaré group. However, the question whether, and if yes in what sense, at least relativistic quantum mechanics can be interpreted as a particle theory at all is not addressed in Wigner's analysis. For this reason the discussion of the particle interpretation of QFT is not finished with Wigner's analysis as one might be tempted to say. For instance the pivotal question of the localizability of particle states is still open.

5.1.1.1 Localization Problems

The observed ‘particle traces’, e.g., on photographic plates of bubble chambers, seem to be a clear indication for the existence of particles. On the other hand, however, the theory which has been built on the basis of these scattering experiments, viz., QFT, turns out to have considerable problems to account for the observed `particle trajectories'. Not only are sharp trajectories excluded by Heisenberg's uncertainty relations for position and momentum coordinates which hold for non-relativistic quantum mechanics already. More advanced theoretical examinations in AQFT which will be described and scrutinized below, show that quantum particles which behave according to the principles of relativity theory cannot be localized in any bounded region of space-time, no matter how large, a result which excludes even tube-like tajectories. From this theoretical point of view it thus appears to be impossible that our world is composed of particles when we assume that localizability in some finite region of space-time is a necessary ingredient of the particle concept. Surprisingly, the very theory which excludes localizability is remarkably good in predicting experiments which apparently involve localizable particles. For the working physicist this contradiction is not an important issue because it does not cause any problems, neither for the theoretical nor the experimental physicist, as long as conceptual questions as such are not at stake.

So far there is no unquestioned proof against the possibility of a particle interpretation for QFT. Although there are “N-particle states” among the possible states of QFT it is not clear how these states relate to N particles. The pieces of circumstantial evidence against a particle interpretation seem to be strong. The core of these pieces consists in problems to localize “particle states” in any sensible way. Reeh & Schlieder, Hegerfeldt, Malament and Redhead all gained mathematical results, or formalized their interpretation, which prove that certain sets of assumptions, which are taken to be essential for the particle concept, lead to contradictions. However, it is a point of debate what exactly has been shown by these no-go theorems in the end and how the different results relate to one another.

The Reeh-Schlieder theorem (Reeh & Schlieder 1961) is a central analyticity result in AQFT. From a physical point of view the Reeh-Schlieder theorem is based on vacuum correlations. What the Reeh-Schlieder theorem asserts is that acting on the vacuum state Ω with elements of the von Neumann algebra R(O), containing observables associated with space-time region O, one can approximate as closely as one likes any state in Hilbertspace cal H, in particular one that is very different from the vacuum in some space-like separated region O′. The Reeh-Schlieder theorem is thus clearly exploiting long distance correlations of the vacuum. Or one can express the result by saying that local measurements do not allow for a distinction between an N-particle state and the vacuum state. The technical statement of the theorem together with introductory and interpretive comments can be found, e.g., in Redhead 1995a. Redhead's interpretation of the Reeh-Schlieder theorem is that local measurements can never decide whether one observes an N-particle state since a projection operator PΨ which corresponds to an N-particle state Ψ can never be an element of a local algebra R(O) (cf. Redhead 1995a). The consequences of the Reeh-Schlieder theorem for the issue of entanglement are discussed in Clifton & Halvorson 2001.

Malament's no-go theorem, Malament 1996, is another consequence of analyticity which rests on a lemma of Borchers (1967). In short it says that a relativistic quantum theory of a fixed number of particles predicts a zero probability for finding a particle in any spatial set if four conditions are satisfied, namely concerning translation covariance, energy, localizability and locality. The localizability condition is the essential ingredient of the particle concept: A particle—in contrast to a field—cannot be found in two disjoint spatial sets at the same time. The locality condition is the main relativistic part of Malament's assumptions, it requires that the statistics for measurements in one space-time region must not depend on whether or not a measurement has been performed in a space-like related second space-time region. Malament's proof has the weight of a no-go theorem provided that we acccept his four conditions as natural assumptions for a particle interpretation. A relativistic quantum theory of a fixed number of particles, satisfying in particular the localizability and the locality condition, has to assume a world devoid of particles (or at least a world in which particles can never be detected) in order not to contradict itself. Malament's no-go theorem thus seems to show that there is no middle ground between QM and QFT, i.e., no theory which deals with a fixed number of particles (like in QM) and which is relativistic (like QFT) without running into the localizability problem of the no-go theorem. One is forced towards QFT which, as Malament is convinced, can only be understood as a field theory. Nevertheless, whether or not a particle interpretation of QFT is in fact ruled out by Malament's result is a point of debate. At least prima facie Malament's no-go theorem alone cannot supply a final answer since it assumes a fixed number of particles, an assumption that is not valid in the case of QFT.

The results about non-localizability which have been explored above may appear to be not very astonishing in the light of the following facts about ordinary QM: Quantum mechanical wave functions (in position representation) are usually smeared out over all Reals3, so that everywhere in space there is a non-vanishing probability for finding a particle. This is even the case arbitrarily close after a sharp position measurement due to the instantaneous spreading of wave packets over all space. Note, however, that ordinary QM is non-relativistic. A conflict with SRT would thus not be very surprising although it is not yet clear whether the above-mentioned quantum mechanical phenomena can actually be exploited to allow for superluminal signalling. QFT, on the other side, has been designed to be in accordance with special relativity theory (SRT). The local behaviour of phenomena is one of the leading principles upon which the theory was built. This makes non-localizability within the formalism of QFT a much severer problem for a particle interpretation.

Malament's reasoning has come under attack in Fleming & Butterfield 1999 and Busch 1999. Both argue to the effect that there are alternatives to Malament's conclusion. The main line of thought in both criticisms is that Malament's ‘mathematical result’ might just as well be interpreted as evidence that the assumed concept of a sharp localization operator is flawed and has to be modified either by allowing for unsharp localization (Busch 1999) or for so-called “hyperplane dependent localization” (Fleming & Butterfield 1999). In Saunders 1995 a different conclusion from Malament's (as well as from similar) results is drawn. Rather than granting Malament's four conditions and deriving a problem for a particle interpretation Saunders takes Malament's proof as further evidence that one can not hold on to all four conditions. According to Saunders it is the localizability condition which might not be a natural and necessary requirement on second thought. Stressing that “relativity requires the language of events, not of things” Saunders argues that the localizability condition loses its plausibility when it is applied to events: It makes no sense to postulate that the same event can not occur at two disjoint spatial sets at the same time. One can only require for the same kind of event not to occur at both places. For Saunders the particle interpretation as such is not at stake in Malament's argument. The question is rather whether QFT speaks about things at all. Saunders considers Malament's result to give a negative answer to this question. A kind of meta paper on Malament's theorem is Clifton & Halvorson 2002. Various objections to the choice of Malament's assumptions and his conclusion are considered and rebutted. Moreover, Clifton and Halvorson establish two further no-go theorems which preserve Malament's theorem by weakening tacit assumptions and showing that the general conclusion still holds. One thing seems to be clear. Since Malament's ‘mathematical result’ appears to allow for various different conclusions it cannot be taken as conclusive evidence against the tenability of a particle interpretation of QFT and the same applies to Redhead's interpretation of the Reeh-Schlieder theorem.

5.1.1.2 Further Problems for a Particle Interpretation of QFT

The standard definition for the vacuum state |0> is that it is the energy ground state, i.e., the eigenstate of the energy operator with the lowest eigenvalue. It is a notable result in ordinary non-relativistic QM that the ground state energy of e.g., the harmonic oscillator is not zero in contrast to its analogue in classical mechanics. Not only is the same true for the vacuum state in QFT, the relativistic vacuum of QFT displays even more striking features. The expectation values for various quantities do not vanish for the vacuum state. The label ‘|0>’ does not indicate that the energy is zero in the vacuum state. It rather stems from the assumption that there are no particles present in the vacuum state: an N-particle state can be built up from the vacuum state by the N-fold application of a creation operator. Non-vanishing vacuum expectation values prompt the question what it is that has these values or gives rise to them if the vacuum is taken to be the state with no particles present. Since the vacuum state |0> is closely linked to N-particle states where N is not zero, properties of the vacuum state have a great impact on the particle interpretation as such. If particles were the basic objects about which QFT speaks how can it be that there are physical phenomena even if nothing is there according to this very ontology?

An even greater related challenge for a particle interpretation of QFT is the Unruh effect. The Unruh effect is a surprising result which seems to show that the concept of a particle is observer dependent. The Unruh effect is the striking phenomenon that a uniformly accelerated observer in a Minkowski vacuum will detect a thermal bath of particles, the so-called Rindler quanta (Unruh 1976 and Unruh & Wald 1984). Whereas the number of particles in the Minkowski vacuum is 0, an accelerated observer suddenly detects a thermal bath of particles. A mere change of the frame of reference thus leads to a change of the number of particles. Since basic features of a theory should be invariant under transformations of the referential frame the Unruh effect constitutes a severe challenge to the concept of particles as basic objects of QFT. Teller tries to show, in Teller 1995, that the Unruh effect is not a fundamental problem for a particle interpretation. Further extensive studies have been done by H. Halvorson, partly together with R. Clifton, reprinted in Butterfield & Halvorson 2004 together with various other important papers.

Eventually, studies of QFT in curved space-time show that the particle concept hinges on Poincaré symmetry. This result indicates that the existence of a particle number operator might be a contingent property of the flat Minkowski space-time. In flat space-time Poincaré symmetry is used to pick out a preferred representation of the canonical commutation relations which is equivalent to picking out a preferred vacuum state. This leads to the standard notion of a particle. However, neither the existence of global families of inertial observers nor the Poincaré tranformations which relate between these families can be generalized to curved space-time. QFT in curved space-time can actually teach us something about standard QFT (in flat space-time). Since QFT in flat space-time is a special case of QFT in curved space-time, QFT in curved space-time can help us to see what is contingent in QFT in flat space-time.

5.1.1.3 Results

On the one side, the adoption of a particle interpretation of QFT would make the importance of particle experiments and the predominance of speaking in terms of particles comprehensible. It could explain why charge only exists in discrete amounts which is a typical feature of particles and not continuously which is characteristic for fields. On the other side, we saw that there are various problems for a particle interpretation. Some results indicate that particle states cannot be localized in any finite region of space-time no matter how large it is. Other results show that the particle number might not be an objective feature. Nevertheless, it turned out that most arguments need to be seen in relative terms. At this stage of research it can only be recorded that there are various potential threats for a particle interpretation.

5.1.2 The Field Interpretation of QFT

Classical Newtonian mechanics is formulated as a theory about bodies and forces with “action at a distance”. It is only stated which force bodies exert on each other while nothing is said about how these effects are mediated since it is assumed that there is an instantaneous interaction between two massive bodies. It turned out that the electromagnetic interaction between charged bodies cannot be described within this framework. A mediating field, the electromagnetic field, had to be introduced which accounts for the local transmission of electromagnetic forces. The systematic and efficient formulation of the theory of electromagnetism with Maxwell's equations at its core revealed another famous feature. There is a limiting velocity for the transmission of signals, namely the velocity of light. In classical electromagnetism the existence of a limiting velocity for the transmission of signals simply emerged from this theory which rests on observed electromagnetic phenomena. Einstein established this feature as a requirement for any physical theory, hence the term ‘Einstein causality’.

While the concept of fields as mediators for the transmission of forces is intuitively helpful, the standard definition of a field is somewhat different. A field is generally defined as a system with an infinite number of degrees of freedom for which certain field equations must hold. A point particle, in contrast, can be described by its position x(t) which changes as the time t progresses so that, in a three-dimensional space, there are three degrees of freedom for the motion of a point particle corresponding to the three coordinates of the particle's position. In the case of a field the description is more complex since one needs a specification of a field value φ for each point x in space where this specification can change as the time t progresses. A field is therefore specified by φ(x,t), i.e., a (time-dependent) mapping from each point of space to a field value. Whereas the intuitive notion of a field is that it is something transient and fundamentally different from matter, it is perfectly normal in physics to ascribe energy and even momentum to a pure field where no particles are present. This surprising feature shows how gradual the distinction between fields and matter can be.

There are two lines of argumentation which are often taken to show that an ontology of fields is the appropriate construal of the most fundamental entities to which QFT refers. The first argumentation rests on the fact that so-called field operators are at the base of the mathematical formalism of QFT. The other line of argumentation is indirect. Since various arguments seem to exclude a particle interpretation, the allegedly only alternative, namely a field interpretation, must be the right conception.

The transition from a classical field theory (like electromagnetism) to quantum field theory can be characterized by the transition from the field φ(x,t) to the quantum field φ̂(x,t), and a corresponding transition for its conjugate field for both of which a certain specification of canonical commutation relations holds. In difference to a classical field φ(x,t), the basic fields φ̂(x,t) of QFT are operator-valued fields since to each point of space and time an operator is attached. There is a formal analogy between classical and quantum fields: field values are attached to space-time points where these values are real-valued in the case of classical fields and operator-valued in the case of quantum fields. In technical terms the analogy reads as one between the mappings x mapsto φ(x,t), x ∈ Reals3, and x mapsto φ̂(x,t), x ∈ Reals3. This formal analogy between classical and quantum fields is one reason why QFT is taken to be a field theory. However, it has to be examined whether this formal analogy actually justifies this conclusion.

In his paper “What the quantum field is not” (Teller 1990, also chapter five in Teller 1995), Teller criticizes this conclusion. Teller argues that ‘quantum fields’ lack an essential feature of classical field theories so that the expression ‘quantum field’ is only justified on a “perverse reading" of the notion of a field. His reason for this conclusion is that in the case of quantum fields—in contrast to classical fields—there are no definite physical values whatsoever assigned to space-time points. Instead, the assigned quantum field operators represent the whole spectrum of possible values so that they rather have the status of observables (Teller: “determinables”) or general solutions. Something physical emerges only when the state of the system or when initial and boundary conditions are supplied. Teller's criticism of the standard gloss about operator-valued quantum fields has one justified and one unjustified aspect. The justified aspect is that quantum fields actually differ considerably from classical fields since the field values which are attached to space-time points have no direct physical significance in the case of a quantum field. However, it was not to be expected anyway that one would only encounter definite values for physical quantities in QFT since it is, like QM, an inherently probabilistic theory after all and is equally confronted with the measurement problem.

Nevertheless, even taking the probabilistic character of QFT into account there still is the problem that one needs quantum fields as well as state vectors in order to fix probabilistic properties. But one should not conclude that quantum fields are not physically significant at all since physical significance of field quantities in QFT cannot be judged along classical distinctions. There is considerable physical information encoded in quantum fields but the field character of QFT is by no means as obvious as it first seems. The formal analogy between classical and quantum fields as such is not a fully convincing argument for a field interpretation of QFT. If a field interpretation should actually yield the appropriate ontology for QFT than it seems that those objects which are called “quantum fields” are not already the fundamental entities one is looking for, at least not alone. Teller's own proposal is an ontology of QFT in terms of field quanta. Teller argues that the “Fock space representation” or “occupation number representation” suggests this conception with objects (quanta) which can be counted or aggregated but which cannot be numbered. The number of objects is given by the degree of excitation of a certain mode of the underlying field. Particle labels like the ones in the Schrödinger many-particle formalism do not occur any more. Teller has been criticized to draw such far-reaching ontological conclusions from one particular representation, in particular since the Fock space representation cannot be appropriate in general because it is only valid for free particles.

5.1.3 Alternative Ontologies

On the background of various problems with particle as well as field interpretations of QFT there are a number of proposals for alternative ontological approaches. In Auyang 1995 and Dieks 2002 different versions of event ontologies are proposed. Seibt 2002 and Hättich 2004 defend process-ontological accounts of QFT. A critical examination of a process ontological understanding of QFT is given in Kuhlmann 2000 and also in Kuhlmann 2002 where an interpretation in terms of so-called tropes (i.e., properties understood as particulars) is proposed as a better alternative. Cao argues, e.g., in Cao 1997b, that the best ontological access to QFT is gained by concentrating on structural properties rather than on any particular category of entities.

5.2 Symmetries, Heuristics, and Objectivity

Symmetries play a central role in QFT. In order to characterize a special symmetry one has to specify transformations T and features, which remain unchanged during these transformations (invariants I), symmetries are thus pairs {T, I}. The basic idea is that the transformation change elements of the mathematical description (the Lagrangians for instance) whereas the empirical content of the theory is unchanged. There are space-time transformations and so-called internal transformations. Whereas space-time symmetries are universal, i. e., they are valid for all interactions, internal symmetries characterize special sorts of interaction (strong, electromagnetic or weak interaction). Symmetry transformations define properties of particles/quantum fields which are conserved if the symmetry is not broken. The invariance of a system defines a conservation law, e.g., if a system is invariant under translations the linear momentum is conserved, if it is invariant under rotation the angular momentum is conserved. Inner transformations such as so-called gauge transformations are connected with more abstract properties.

Symmetries are not only defined for Lagrangians but they can also be found in empirical data and phenomenological descriptions. Symmetries can thus bridge the gap between descriptions which are close to empirical results (‘phenomenology’) and the more abstract general theory which is a most important reason for their heuristic force. If a conservation law is found one has some knowledge about the system even if details of the dynamics are unknown. The analysis of many high energy collision experiments led to the assumption of special conservation laws for abstract properties like baryon number or strangeness. Evaluating experiments in this way allowed for a classification of particles. This phenomenological classification was good enough to predict new particles which could be found in the experiments. Free places in the classification could be filled even if the dynamics of the theory (for example the Lagrangian of strong interaction) was yet unknown. As the history of QFT for strong interaction shows considerable constraints on the construction of dynamics follow from symmetries found in the phenomenological description: The Lagrangian should not exhibit less symmetries than the phenomenology. Arguments from group theory played a decisive role in the unification of fundamental interactions. In addition, symmetries bring about substantial technical advantages. For example, by using gauge transformations one can bring the Lagrangian into a form which makes it easy to prove the renormalizability of the theory. See also the entry on symmetry and symmetry breaking.

Symmetries are not only instruments of provisional physics used in not yet fully developed theories. Symmetries also supply some sort of ‘justification’, they are often used in the beginning of a chain of explanation. To a remarkable degree the present theories of elementary particle interactions can be understood by deduction from general principles. Under these principles symmetry requirements play a crucial role in order to determine the Lagrangian. For example, the only Lorentz invariant and gauge invariant renormalizable Lagrangian for photons and electrons is precisely the original Dirac Lagrangian. In this way symmetry arguments acquire an explanatory power and help to minimize the unexplained basic assumptions of a theory. Heisenberg concludes that in order “to find the way to a real understanding of the spectrum of particles it will therefore be necessary to look for the fundamental symmetries and not for the fundamental particles.” (Blum et al. 1995, p. 507).

Since symmetry operations change the perspective of an observer but not the physics an analysis of the relevant symmetry group can yield very general information about those entities which are unchanged by transformations. Such an invariance under a symmetry group is a necessary (but not sufficient) requirement for something to belong to the ontology of the considered physical theory. Hermann Weyl propagated the idea that objectivity is associated with invariance (see, e.g., his authoritative work Weyl 1952, p. 132). Symmetries help to separate objective facts from the conventions of descriptions (see Kosso in Brading & Castellani 2003).

Symmetries are typical examples for such abstract mathematical structures that show much more continuity in scientific change than assumptions about the entities of a theory (light as particles, as waves, as quantum fields). For that reason structural realists consider abstract structures as “the best candidate for what is ‘true’ about a physical theory” (Redhead 1999, p. 34). Physical entities (like electrons) are similar to fictions and, in the end, should not be taken seriously. In the epistemic variant of structural realism structure is all we know about nature whereas the objects which are related by structures might exist but they are not accessible to us. In the ontic variant of structural realism nature seems to be reduced to mathematical objects. In the world, there is nothing but structure.

Symmetry considerations are of central importance in Auyang 1995 where the connection between properties of physically relevant symmetry groups and ontological questions is stressed. A recent anthology with various philosophical studies about symmetries in physics is Brading & Castellani 2003. For an account and defence of structural realism see Ladyman 1998.

5.3 Atomism and Reductionism

There is a coherent tradition of philosophical thinking about nature from early ancient times to our days. One indication for this coherence is the fact that some of the most outstanding twentieth century physicists like Schrödinger and Heisenberg put considerable emphasis on the linkage between quantum physics and ancient Greek philosophy. The monographs Schrödinger 1954 and Heisenberg 1958 are just two of their explictly philosophical works. Atomism can be seen as one form of reductionism with its assertion that everything can be reduced to some basic building blocks. In order to clarify possible ways to understand this assertion and some of its consequences it is helpful to distinguish different notions of reductionism. One reductionist position is that all scientific theories can and should be reduced to a fundamental theory which is generally taken to be found in physics. Another reductionist position is more modest. It agrees with the first reductionist view that the reduction of higher-level theories to lower-level theories is possible in principle. However, the modest reductionist thinks that a reduction to the lowest possible level is often neither practically feasible nor even desirable. The question whether QFT is an atomistic theory hinges on the understanding of atomism. The answer could be ‘yes’, if atomism is understood as the availability of reductionist explanations, and ‘no’, if atomism is understood as the claim that all there is are particles and the void. However, looking at effective field theories, even the ‘yes’ with respect to reductionism could turn into a ‘no’ since there is no fundamental level of particles/fields any more (see Cao & Schweber 1993). Further discussions of the significance of effective field theories for the question of reductionism can be found in Hartmann 2001 and Castellani 2002.

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