Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
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Suicide

First published Tue 18 May, 2004

Suicide is an enigmatic and disconcerting phenomenon. Because of others' inability to directly occupy the mental world of the suicidal, suicide appears to elude easy explanation. This inexplicability is stunningly captured by Jeffrey Eugenides in his novel The Virgin Suicides. In the novel, the narrator describes the reactions of several teenaged boys to the suicides of five sisters. The boys keep a collection of the dead girls' belongings, repeatedly sifting through them in a vain attempt to understand their deaths.

In the end we had the pieces of the puzzle, but no matter how we put them together, gaps remained, oddly shaped emptinesses mapped by what surrounded them, like countries we couldn't name. (Eugenides 1993, 246)

Undoubtedly, the challenge of simply fathoming suicide accounts for the vast array of attitudes toward suicide found in the history of Western civilization: bafflement, dismissal, heroic glorification, sympathy, anger, moral or religious condemnation. Suicide is now an object of multidisciplinary scientific study, with sociology, anthropology, psychology, and psychiatry each providing important insights into suicide. Particularly promising are the significant advances being made in our scientific understanding of the neurological basis of suicidal behavior (Stoff and Mann 1997) and the mental conditions associated with it. Nonetheless, certain questions about suicide seem to fall at least partially outside the domain of science, and indeed, suicide has been a focus of philosophical examination in the West since at least the time of Plato. For philosophers, suicide raises a host of conceptual, theological, moral, and psychological questions. Among these questions are: What makes a person's behavior suicidal? What motivates such behavior? Is suicide morally permissible, or even morally required in some extraordinary circumstances? Is suicidal behavior rational? This article will examine the main currents of historical and contemporary philosophical thought surrounding these questions.

1. Characterizing Suicide

Surprisingly, philosophical difficulties emerge when we even attempt to characterize suicide precisely, and attempts to do so introduce intricate issues about how to describe and explain human action. In particular, identifying a set of necessary and sufficient conditions for suicide that fits well with our typical usage of the term is especially challenging. A further challenge is that because suicide is strongly colored by negative emotional or moral connotations, efforts to distinguish suicidal behavior from other behavior often clandestinely import moral judgments about the aims or moral worth of such behavior. That is, views about the nature of suicide often incorporate, sometimes unknowingly, views about the prudential or moral justifiability of suicide and are therefore not value-neutral descriptions of suicide. Definitions of suicide are "sometimes dependent on prior judgments about its justifiability." (Lebacqz & Englehardt 1980, 701.) Theorists about suicide often fail to divorce questions about whether an act was suicide from whether its motives were admirable or odious. Hitler, most people contend, was clearly a suicide, but Socrates and Jesus were not. (Though on Socrates, see Frey 1978) Suicide still carries a strongly negative subtext, and on the whole, we exhibit a greater willingness to categorize self-killings intended to avoid one's just deserts as suicides than self-killings intended to benefit others (Beauchamp & Childress 1983, 93-94.) Some go so far as to deny the possibility that an act of self- killing motivated by altruism can count as suicide (Margolis 1980.)

Such conceptual slipperiness befuddles moral arguments about the justifiability of suicide by permitting us to ‘define away’ self-killings we believe are justified as something other than suicide, whereas it would be desirable to identify first a defensible non-normative conception of suicide and then proceed to discuss the moral merits of various acts of suicide (Kupfer 1990.) Some philosophers, on the other hand, have embraced the apparently value-laden character of suicide, suggesting that word ‘suicide’ has as one its functions the ascription of moral responsibility, and insofar as disagreements about the extent to which agents themselves (as opposed to social conditions, medical facts, etc.) are morally responsible for their deaths persist, so too will apparently conceptual disagreements about the nature of suicide persist (Stern-Gillett 1987.)

Supposing, however, that a purely descriptive account of suicide is possible, where should it begin? While it is tempting to say that suicide is any self-caused death, this account is vulnerable to obvious counterexamples. An individual who knows the health risks of smoking or of skydiving, but willfully engages in these behaviors and dies as a result, could be said to be causally responsible for her own death but not to have committed suicide. Similarly, an individual who takes a swig of hydrochloric acid, believing it to be lemonade, and subsequently dies causes her own death but does not engage in suicidal behavior. Moreover, not only are there self-caused deaths that are not suicides, but there are behaviors that result in death and are arguably suicidal in which the agent is not the cause of her own death or is so only at one remove. This can occur when an individual arranges the circumstances for her death. A terminally ill patient who requests that another person inject her with a lethal dose of tranquilizers has, intuitively, committed suicide. Though she is not immediately causally responsible for her death, she appears morally responsible for her death, since she initiates a sequence of events which she intended to culminate in her death, a sequence which cannot be explained without reference to her beliefs and desires. (Such a case might also be an example of voluntary euthanasia.) Likewise, those who commit ‘suicide by cop,’ where an armed crime is committed in order to provoke police into shooting its perpetrator, are responsible for their own deaths despite not being the causes of their deaths. In these kinds of cases, such agents would not die, or would not be at an elevated risk for death, were it not for their initiating such causal sequences. (See Brandt 1975, Tolhurst 1983, Frey 1981, but for a possible objection see Kupfer 1990).

Furthermore, many philosophers (Fairbairn 1995, chapter 5) doubt whether an act's actually resulting in death is essential to suicide at all. It is common to speak of ‘attempted’ or ‘failed’ suicides, instances where because of agents' false beliefs (about the lethality of their behavior, for example), unforeseen factual circumstances, others' interventions, etc., an act which might have resulted in an agent's death does not.

Hence, suicidal behavior need not result in death, nor must the condition that hastens death be self-caused. It follows, therefore that, first, a correct account of suicide (contra Durkheim 1897) must emphasize the non-accidental relationship between suicidal behavior and death (i.e., death is in some respect the aim of suicidal behavior). Second, what appears essential for a behavior to count as suicide is that the person in question chooses to die. Suicide is an attempt to inflict death upon oneself and is "intentional rather than consequential in nature." (Fairbairn 1995, 58) These conclusions imply that suicide must rest upon an individual's intentions (where an intention implicates an individual's beliefs and desires about her action. (See Brandt 1975, Tolhurst 1983, Frey 1978, O'Keefee 1981) One intention-based account of suicide (similar to Graber 1981, 57) would say, roughly, that

  1. A person S's behavior B is suicidal iff
    1. S believed that B, or some causal consequence of B, would make her death at least highly likely, and
    2. S intended to die by engaging in B.

This account renders the notion of suicide as self-inflicted attempted death more precise, but it is not without its shortcomings.

Condition (a) is a doxastic condition, and is meant to rule out as suicides deaths (or increased risks for death) caused by an individual's behavior where the individual causes these outcomes but does so out of ignorance of the relevant risks of her behavior, as when an individual accidentally takes a lethal dose of a prescription drug. At the same time, (a) accounts for cases such as the aforementioned terminally ill patient whose death is caused only indirectly by her request to die. Condition (a) does not require that S know that B will put her at a significantly greater risk for death, nor even that S's beliefs about B's lethality be true or even justified. Suicidal individuals often have false beliefs about the lethality of their chosen suicide methods, greatly overestimating the lethality of over the counter painkillers while underestimating the lethality of handguns, for instance. An individual could believe falsely, or on the basis of inadequate evidence, that placing one's head in an electric oven significantly increases one's chances of dying, but that behavior is nonetheless suicidal. The demand that S believe that B makes death highly likely is admittedly inexact, but it permits us to navigate between two extreme and mistaken views. On the one hand, it rules out as suicidal behavior that which is in fact only marginally more likely to cause a person's death (you are more likely to die in your car than in your living room) and is rarely utilized as a suicide method anyway. On the other hand, to demand that S believe that B certainly or almost certainly will cause S's death is too strict, since it will rarely be the case (given the possibility of intervening conditions, etc.) that B will necessarily cause S's death, and in fact, many suicidal individuals are ambivalent about their actions, an ambivalence which is turn reflected in their selecting suicide methods that are far from certain to cause death. It also allows us to distinguish genuinely suicidal behavior from suicidal gestures, in which individuals engage in behavior they believe is not likely to cause their death but is nonetheless associated with suicide attempts, while in fact having some other intention (e.g., gaining others' sympathy) in mind.

Condition (b), however, is far more knotty. For what is it to intend by one's behavior that death result? There are examples in which condition (a) is met, but whether (b) is met is more problematic. For instance, does a soldier who leaps upon a live grenade tossed into a foxhole in order to save his comrades engage in suicidal behavior? Many, especially partisans of the doctrine of double effect, would answer ‘no’: Despite the fact that the solider knew his behavior would likely cause him to die, his intention was to absorb the blast so as to save the other soldiers, whereas his death was only a foreseen outcome of his action. Needless to say, whether a clear and non-manipulable divide exists between foreseen and intended outcomes is controversial (Glover 1990, ch. 6) (It is of course possible that whether death is foreseen or intended has no bearing on whether an act counts as suicide but still bears on whether that suicide is justified.) Some would argue that given the near certainty of his dying by jumping on the grenade, his death was at least weakly intended, in Alvin Goldman's sense (Tolhurst 1983.) At the same time, cases that are commonly viewed as suicide do not exhibit an full-fledged intention to die. Current psychiatric theory holds that many examples of suicidal behavior do not aim at death but are "cries for help." In such cases, the person does not wish to die, but intends to gain others' attention in such a fashion that holds out the possibility of death. However, it seems correct to say that when a person who issues a cry for help does die, despite not intending to die, their death is neither foreseen, since the person actually intends not to die, nor wholly accidental, since the person knowingly engaged in behavior that she believed will make her death significantly more likely, making her death in an obvious sense self-inflicted. (But see Graber 1981, 58) Such a case might indicate the need for a third category besides intentional suicide and accidental death, call it unintentional death or unintended suicide.

The essential logical difficulty here resides in the notion of intending to die, for acting so as to produce one's death nearly always has some other aim or justification. That is, death is generally not chosen for its own sake, or is not the end of suicidal behavior. Suicidal behavior can have any number of objectives: the relief of physical pain, the relief of psychological anguish, martyrdom in the service of a moral cause, the fulfillment of perceived societal duties (suttee and seppuku, e.g.), the avoidance of judicial execution, revenge on others, protection of others' interests or well-being. (See Fairbairn 1995, ch. 9, for a taxonomy of the varieties of suicide.) Therefore, it is not the case that suicidal individuals intend death per se, but rather that death is perceived, rightly or wrongly, as a means for the fulfillment of another of the agent's aims. (Graber 1981, 56) In short, there do not appear to be any compelling examples of "noninstrumental" self-killings in which "the overriding intention is simply to end one's life and there is no further independent objective involved in the action." (O'Keefee 1981, 357) Nor does requiring that the individual wish to be dead (Fairbairn 1995, ch. 6) address this issue, since again, what one wishes is presumably not death itself but some outcome of death. Both the grenade-jumping soldier and the depressed individual issuing a ‘cry for help’ may wish not to die insofar as they might prefer that their desires could be satisfied without dying or without putting themselves at the risk thereof. However, this is consistent with their willingly choosing to die in order to satisfy their aims.

Some might wish to add a further condition to (a) and (b) above:

  1. S was not coerced into B-ing.

Yet again, both the concept of coercion and its applicability to instances of risky or self-harming behavior is unclear. Typically, coercion denotes interference by others. So, according to condition (c), a spy threatened with torture lest he relinquish crucial military secrets who then poisons himself did not commit suicide, some would contend, since the spy's captors compelled him to take his life. However, one can imagine a similar situation in which the agent of "coercion" is not another person. An extremely ill patient may opt to take his own life rather than face a future fraught with physical pain. But why should we not say that this patient was coerced by his situation and therefore did not commit suicide? Because of their desires, loyalties, and values, both the spy and the ill patient saw themselves as having no other alternative, given their ends, but to cause their own deaths. In both instances, the economy of the individuals' reasons for actions was modified by circumstances outside their control so as to make death a rational option where it previously was not. Thus, there does not appear to be grounds for restricting coercion only to interference by other people, since factual circumstances can be similarly coercive. Either any factor, natural, human, or otherwise, that influences an individual's reasoning so as to make death the most rational option counts as coercion, at which point condition (c) hardly functions as a restriction at all, or cases such as the spy facing torture are suicides too and (c) is unnecessary. (See Tolhurst 1983, 113-115)

This brief attempt at conceptual analysis of suicide illustrates the frustrations of such a project, as the unclear notion of suicide is apparently replaced by equally unclear notions such as intention and coercion. We may be attracted to increasingly baroque or impractical analyses of suicide (Donnelly 1998, 20) or accept that suicide is an ‘open textured’ concept instances of which are bound together only by weak Wittgensteinian family resemblance and hence resistant to analysis in terms of strict logical conditions. (Windt 1981)

An alternative to providing necessary and sufficient conditions for suicidal behavior is to view it along a continuum. In the psychological sciences, most suicidologists view suicide not as an either/or notion but as a gradient notion, admitting of degrees based on individuals' beliefs, strength of intentions, and attitudes. The Beck Scale for Suicidal Ideation is perhaps the best example of this approach. (See Beck 1979)

2. Highlights of Historical Thought

2.1 Ancient and Classical Views of Suicide

Philosophical discourse about suicide stretches back at least to the time of Plato. Still, prior to the Stoics at least, suicide tended to get sporadic rather than systematic attention from philosophers in the ancient Mediterranean world. As John Cooper has noted (Cooper 1989, 10), neither ancient Greek nor Latin had a single word that aptly translates our ‘suicide,’ even though most of the ancient city-states criminalized self-killing.

Plato explicitly discussed suicide in two works. First, in Phaedo, Socrates expresses guarded enthusiasm for the thesis, associated with the Pythagoreans, that suicide is always wrong because it represents our releasing ourselves (i.e., our souls) from a "guard-post" (i.e., our bodies) the gods have placed us in as a form of punishment (Phaedo 61b-62c.) Later, in the Laws, Plato claimed that suicide is disgraceful and its perpetrators should be buried in unmarked graves. However, Plato recognized four exceptions to this principle: (1) when one's mind is morally corrupted and one's character can therefore not be salvaged (Laws IX 854a3-5), (2) when the self-killing is done by judicial order, as in the case of Socrates, (3) when the self-killing is compelled by extreme and unavoidable personal misfortune, and (4) when the self-killing results from shame at having participated in grossly unjust actions. (Laws IX 873c-d) Suicide under these circumstances can be excused, but, according to Plato, it is otherwise an act of cowardice or laziness undertaken by individuals too delicate to manage life's vicissitudes. Aristotle's only discussion of suicide (Nicomachean Ethics 1138a5-14) is a difficult and confusing passage in which he attempts to explain how suicide can be unjust and deserving of punishment if the individual who could be treated unjustly is the suicidal individual herself. He concludes that suicide is somehow a wrong to the state, though he does not outline the nature of this wrong or the specific vices that suicidal individuals exhibit.

What is perhaps most striking about Plato's and Aristotle's texts on suicide is the relative absence of concern for individual well-being or autonomy. Both limit the justifications for suicide largely to considerations about an individual's social roles and obligations. In contrast, the Stoics largely believed that the moral permissibility of suicide did not hinge on the moral character of the individual pondering it. Rather, the Stoics held that whenever the means to living a naturally flourishing life are not available to us, suicide may be justified, regardless of the character or virtue of the individual in question. Our natures require certain "natural advantages" (e.g., physical health) in order for us to be happy, and a wise person who recognizes that such advantages may be lacking in her life sees that ending her life neither enhances nor diminishes her moral virtue.

When a man's circumstances contain a preponderance of things in accordance with nature, it is appropriate for him to remain alive; when he possesses or sees in prospect a majority of the contrary things, it is appropriate for him to depart from life…. Even for the foolish, who are also miserable, it is appropriate for them to remain alive if they possess a predominance of those things which we pronounce to be in accordance with nature. (Cicero, III, 60-61)

Hence, not only may concerns related to one's obligations to others justify suicide, but one's own private good is relevant too. The Roman Stoic Seneca, who was himself compelled to commit suicide, was even bolder, claiming that since "mere living is not a good, but living well", a wise person "lives as long as he ought, not as long as he can." For Seneca, it is the quality, not the quantity, of one's life that matters.

2.2 The Christian Prohibition

The advent of institutional Christianity was perhaps the most important event in the philosophical history of suicide, for Christian doctrine has by and large held that suicide is morally wrong, despite the fact that no passage in Scripture unequivocally condemns suicide. Although the early church fathers opposed suicide, St. Augustine is generally credited with offering the first thoroughgoing justification of the Christian prohibition on suicide (Amundsen 1989.) He saw the prohibition as a natural extension of the fifth commandment:

The law, rightly interpreted, even prohibits suicide, where it says ‘Thou shalt not kill.’ This is proved especially by the omission of the word ‘thy neighbor’, which are inserted when false witness is forbidden in the commandment there is no limitation added nor exception made in favor of any one, and least of all in favor of him on whom the command is laid! (Augustine, book I, chapter 20)

Suicide, Augustine determined, was an unrepentable sin. St. Thomas Aquinas later defended this prohibition on three grounds. (1) Suicide is contrary to natural self-love, whose aim is to preserve us. (2) Suicide injures the community of which an individual is a part. (3) Suicide violates our duty to God because God has given us life as a gift and in taking our lives we violate His right to determine the duration of our earthly existence (Aquinas 1271, part II, Q64, A5.) This conclusion was codified in the medieval doctrine that suicide nullified human beings' relationship to God, for our control over our body was limited to usus (possession, employment) where God retained dominium (dominion, authority). Law and popular practice in the Middle Ages sanctioned the desecration of the suicidal corpse, along with confiscation of property and denial of Christian burial.

The rediscovery of numerous texts of classical antiquity was one of the spurs of the Renaissance, but for the most part, Renaissance intellectuals generally affirmed the Church's opposition to suicide and were not sympathetic to the more permissive attitudes toward suicide found among the ancient pagans. Two intriguing sixteenth century exceptions were Thomas More and Michel de Montaigne. In his Utopia, More appears to recommend voluntary suicide for those suffering from painful and incurable diseases, though the satirical and fantastical tone of that work makes it doubtful that More supported this proposal in reality. In his Essais, Montaigne relates several anecdotes of individuals taking their own lives and intersperses these anecdotes with quotations from Roman writers praising suicide. While his general skepticism prevented Montaigne from staking out a firm moral position on suicide, he gives only a nod to the orthodox Christian position and conceptualizes the issue not in traditional theological terms but as a matter of personal judgment or conscience (Ferngren 1989, 160-161.)

The Protestant Reformers, including Calvin, condemned suicide as roundly as did the established Church, but held out the possibility of God treating suicide mercifully and permitting repentance. Interest in moral questions concerning suicide was particularly strong in this period among England's Protestants, notably the Puritans. Nonetheless, the traditional Christian view prevailed well into the late seventeenth century, where even an otherwise liberal thinker such as John Locke echoed earlier Thomistic arguments, claiming that though God bestowed upon us our natural personal liberty, that liberty does not include the liberty to destroy oneself (Locke 1690, ch. 2, para. 6.)

In all likelihood, the first comprehensive modern defense of suicide was John Donne's Biathanatos (c. 1607.) Not intended for publication, Biathanatos drew upon an array of classical and modern legal and theological sources to argue that Christian doctrine should not hold that suicide is necessarily sinful. His critique is in effect internal, drawing upon the logic of Christian thought itself to suggest that suicide is not contrary to the laws of nature, of reason, or of God. Were it contrary to the law of nature mandating self-preservation, all acts of self-denial or privation would be similarly unlawful. Moreover, there may be circumstances in which reason might recommend suicide. Finally, Donne observes, not only does Biblical Scripture lack a clear condemnation of suicide, Christian doctrine has permitted other forms of killing such as martyrdom, capital punishment and killing in wartime (Minois 1999, 20-21.)

2.3 The Enlightenment and Modern Developments

Donne's casuistical treatise was an early example of the liberalized Enlightenment attitudes of the 1700's. The Thomistic natural-law stance on suicide came under increasing attack as suicide was examined through the lens of science and psychology. Where Christian theology has understood suicide as "an affair between the devil and the individual sinner" (Minois 1999, 300), Enlightenment philosophers tended to conceive of suicide in secular terms, as resulting from facts about individuals, their natural psychologies, and their particular social settings. David Hume gave voice to this new approach with a direct assault on the Thomistic position in his unpublished essay "On suicide" (1783.) Hume saw traditional attitudes toward suicide as muddled and superstitious. According to the Thomistic argument, suicide violates the order God established for the world and usurps God's prerogative in determining when we shall die. Hume's argument against this thesis is intricate, as he tends to juxtapose distinguishable but closely related considerations, but in essence Hume attacks the seemingly arbitrary and contradictory notions of natural law used to condemn suicide. Hume's argument is more or less as follows:
  1. If by the ‘divine order’ is meant the causal laws created by God, then it would always be wrong to contravene these laws for the sake of our own happiness. But clearly it is not wrong, since God frequently permits us to contravene these laws, for he does not expect us not to respond to disease or other calamities. Therefore, there is not apparent justification, as Hume put it, for God's permitting us to disturb nature in some circumstances but not in others. Just as God permits us to divert rivers for irrigation, so too ought he permit us to divert blood from our veins.
  2. If by ‘divine order’ is meant the natural laws God has willed for us, which are (a) discerned by reason, (b) such that adherence to them will produce our happiness, then why should not suicide conform to such laws when it appears rational to us that the balance of our happiness is best served by suicide?
  3. Finally if by ‘divine order’ is meant simply that which occurs according to God's consent, then God appears to consent to all our actions (since an omnipotent God can presumably intervene in our acts at any point) and no distinction exists between those of our actions to which God consents and those to which He does not. If God has placed us upon the Earth like a "sentinel," then our choosing to leave this post and take our lives occurs as much with his cooperation as with any other act we perform.

Furthermore, suicide does not necessarily violate any duties toward other people, according to Hume. Reciprocity may require that we benefit society in exchange for the benefits it provides, but surely such reciprocity reaches its limit when by living we provide only a "frivolous advantage" to society at the expense of significant harm or suffering for ourselves. In more extreme situations, we are actually burdens to others, in which case our deaths are not only "innocent, but laudable."

Finally, Hume rejects the thesis that suicide violates our duties to self. Sickness, old age, and other misfortunes can make life sufficiently miserable that continued existence is worse than death. As to worries that people are likely to attempt to take their lives capriciously, Hume replies that our natural fear of death ensures that only after careful deliberation and assessment of our future prospects will we have the courage and clarity of mind to kill ourselves.

In the end, Hume concludes that suicide "may be free of imputation of guilt and blame." His position is largely utilitarian, allied with a strong presumption of personal liberty. The Enlightenment was of course not univocal in its comparatively permissive attitudes toward suicide. The most vociferous opponent of suicide in this period was Immanuel Kant. Kant's arguments, though they reflect earlier natural law arguments, draw upon his view of moral worth as emanating from the autonomous rational wills of individuals. (Cholbi 2000) For Kant, our rational wills are the source of our moral duty, and it is therefore a kind of practical contradiction to suppose that the same will can permissibly destroy itself. Given the distinctive worth of an autonomous rational will, suicide is an attack on the very source of moral authority.

To annihilate the subject of morality in one's person is to root out the existence of morality itself from the world as far as one can, even though morality is an end in itself. Consequently, disposing of oneself as a mere means to some discretionary end is debasing humanity in one's person… (Kant 423)

The nineteenth and early twentieth centuries brought several developments that, while not explicitly philosophical, have shaped philosophical thought about suicide. The first was the emergence, in novels by Rousseau, Goethe, and Flaubert, of a Romantic idealized ‘script’ for suicide, according to which suicide was the inevitable response of a misunderstood and anguished soul jilted by love or shunned by society (Lieberman 2003.) The second was the recognition of psychiatry as an autonomous discipline, populated by experts capable of diagnosing and treating melancholy, hysteria and other ailments responsible for suicide. Lastly, largely thanks to the work of sociologists such as Durkheim and Laplace, suicide was increasingly viewed as a social ill reflecting widespread alienation, anomie, and other attitudinal byproducts of modernity. In many European nations, the rise in suicide rates was thought to signal a cultural decline. These latter two developments made suicide prevention a bureaucratic and medical preoccupation, leading to a wave of institutionalization for suicidal persons. All three conspired to suggest that suicide is caused by impersonal social or psychological forces rather than by the agency of individuals.

Suicide was of central concern for the twentieth century existentialists, who saw the choice to take one's life as impressed upon us by our experience of the absurdity or meaninglessness of the world and of human endeavor. Albert Camus illustrated this absurdity in his philosophical essay The Myth of Sisyphus. For Camus, Sisyphus heroically does not try to escape his absurd task, but instead perseveres and in so doing resists the lure of suicide. Suicide, Camus contends, tempts us with the promise of an illusory freedom from the absurdity of our existence, but is in the end an abdication of our responsibility to confront or embrace that absurdity head on. (Campbell and Collinson 1988, 61-70). Jean-Paul Sartre was likewise struck by the possibility of suicide as an assertion of authentic human will in the face of absurdity. Suicide is, according to Sartre, an opportunity to stake out our understanding of our essence as individuals in a godless world For the existentialists, suicide was not a choice shaped mainly by moral considerations but by concerns about the individual as the sole source of meaning in a meaningless universe.

3. The Morality and Rationality of Suicide

3.1 Moral Permissibility

The principal moral issue surrounding suicide has been
  1. Are there conditions under which suicide is morally justified, and if so, which conditions?

Several important historical answers to (1) have already been mentioned.

Note that this question should be distinguished from three others:

  1. Should other individuals attempt to prevent suicide?
  2. Should the state criminalize suicide or attempt to prevent it?
  3. Is suicide ever rational or prudent?

Obviously, answers to any one of these four questions will bear on how the other three ought to be answered. For instance, it might be assumed that if suicide is morally permissible in some circumstances, then neither other individuals nor the state should interfere with suicidal behavior (in those same circumstances). However, this conclusion might not follow if those same suicidal individuals are irrational and interference is required in order to prevent them from taking their lives, an outcome their more rational selves might regret. Furthermore, for those moral theories that emphasize rational autonomy, whether an individual has rationally chosen to take her own life may settle all four questions. In any event, the interrelationships among suicide's moral permissibility, its rationality, and the duties of others and of society as a whole is complex, and we should be wary of assuming that an answer to any one of these four questions decisively settles the other three.

3.2 The Deontological Argument from the Sanctity of Life

The simplest moral outlook on suicide holds that it is necessarily wrong because human life is sacred. Though this position is often associated with religious thinkers, especially Catholics, we find similar positions in Kant and in Ronald Dworkin (Dworkin 1993.) According to this ‘sanctity of life’ view, human life is inherently valuable and precious, demanding respect from others and reverence for oneself. Hence, suicide is wrong because it violates our moral duty to honor the inherent value of human life, regardless of the value of that life to others or to the person whose life it is. The sanctity of life view is thus a deontological position on suicide.

The great merit of the sanctity of life position is that it reflects a common moral sentiment, namely, that killing is wrong in itself. The chief difficulties for the sanctity of life position are these:

First, its proponents must be willing to apply the position consistently, which would also morally forbid controversial forms of killing such as capital punishment or killing in wartime. But it would also forbid forms of killing that seem intuitively reasonable, such as killing in self-defense. To accept the sanctity of life argument seems to require endorsing a thoroughgoing pacifism.

Secondly, the sanctity of life view must hold that life itself, wholly independent of the happiness whose life it is, is valuable. Many philosophers reject the notion that life is intrinsically valuable, since it suggests, e.g., that there is value in keeping alive an individual in a persistent vegetative state simply because she is biologically alive. It would also suggest that a life certain to be filled with limitless suffering and anguish is valuable just by virtue of being a human life. Peter Singer (Singer 1994) and others have argued against the sanctity of life position on the grounds that the value of a continuing life is not intrinsic but extrinsic, to be judged on the basis of the individual's likely future quality of life. If the value of a person's continued life is measured by its likely quality, then suicide may be permissible when that quality is low (see section 3.5) (This is not to suggest that quality of life assessments are straightforward or uncontroversial. See Hayry 1991 for discussion).

Finally, it is not obvious that adequate respect for the sanctity of human life prohibits ending a life, whether by suicide or other means. Those who engage in suicidal behavior when their future promises to be extraordinarily bleak do not necessarily exhibit insufficient regard for the sanctity of life. (Dworkin 1993, 238) To end one's life before its natural end is not necessarily an insult to the value of life. Indeed, it may be argued that suicide may be life-affirming in those circumstances where medical or psychological conditions reduce individuals to shadows of their former fully capable selves. (Cholbi 2002)

3.3 Religious Arguments

Two general categories of arguments for the moral impermissibility of suicide have emerged from the Christian religious tradition. The first of these is the aforementioned Thomistic natural law tradition, critiqued by Hume (see section 2.3) According to this tradition, suicide violates the natural law God has created to govern the natural world and human existence. This natural law can be conceived of in terms of (a) natural causal laws, such that suicide violates this causal order, (b) teleological laws, according to which all natural beings seek to preserve themselves, or (c) the laws governing human nature, from which it follows that suicide is ‘unnatural’ (Pabst Battin 1996, 41-48.) These natural law arguments are no longer the main focus of philosophical discussion, as they have been subjected to strenuous criticism by Hume and others. These criticisms include that the natural law arguments cannot be disentangled from a highly speculative theistic metaphysics; that these claims are not confirmed by observations of human nature (e.g., the existence of self-destructive human behaviors casts doubt on the claim that we "naturally" preserve ourselves); and that other acts (e.g., religious martyrdom) which God is assumed not to condemn, also violate these natural laws, making the prohibition on suicide appear arbitrary.

The second general category of religious arguments rest on analogies concerning the relationship between God and humanity. For the most part, these arguments aim to establish that God, and not human individuals, have the proper moral authority to determine the circumstances of their deaths. One historically prominent analogy (suggested by Aquinas and Locke) states that we are God's property and so suicide is a wrong to God akin to theft or destruction of property. This analogy seems weak on several fronts. First, if we are God's property, we are an odd sort of property, in that God apparently bestowed upon us free will that permits to act in ways that are inconsistent with God's wishes or intentions. It is difficult to see how an autonomous entity with free will can be subject to the kind of control or dominion to which other sorts of property are subject. Second, the argument appears to rest on the assumption that God does not wish his property destroyed. Yet given the traditional theistic conception of God as not lacking in any way, how could the destruction of something God owns (a human life) be a harm to God or to his interests? (Holley 1989, 105.) Third, it is difficult to reconcile this argument with the claim that God is all-loving. If a person's life is sufficiently bad, an all-loving God might permit his property to be destroyed through suicide. Finally, some have questioned the extent of the duties imposed by God's property right in us by arguing that the destruction of property might be morally justified in order to prevent significant harm to oneself. If the only available means to saving myself from a ticking bomb is to stash it in the trunk of the nearest car to dampen the blast, and the nearest car belongs to my neighbor, then destroying his property appears justified in order to avoid serious harm to myself. Likewise, if only by killing myself can I avoid a serious future harm to myself, I appear justified in destroying God's property (my life).

Another common analogy asserts that God bestows life upon us a gift, and it would be a mark of ingratitude or neglect to reject that gift by taking our lives. The obvious weakness with this "gift analogy" is that a gift, genuinely given, does not come with conditions such as that suggested by the analogy, i.e., once given, a gift becomes the property of its recipient and its giver no longer has any claim on what the recipient does with this gift. It may perhaps be imprudent to waste an especially valuable gift, but it does not appear to be unjust to a gift giver to do so. As Kluge put it, "a gift we cannot reject is not a gift" (Kluge 1975, 124.) A variation of this line of argument holds that we owe God a debt of gratitude for our lives, and so to kill ourselves would be disrespectful or even insulting to God, (Ramsey 1978, 146) or would amount to an irresponsible use of this gift. Yet this variation does not really evade the criticism directed at the first version: Even if we owe God a debt of gratitude, disposing of our lives does not seem inconsistent with our expressing gratitude for having lived at all (Beauchamp 1992.) Furthermore, if a person's life is rife with misery and unhappiness, it is far from clear that she owes God much in the way of gratitude for this apparently ill-chosen "gift" of life. Defenders of the gift analogy must therefore offer a theodicy to defend the claim that life, because it is given to us by a loving God, is an expression of God's benevolent nature and is therefore necessarily a benefit to us (Holley 1989, 113-114.)

In addition, there is a less recognized undercurrent of religious thought that favors suicide. For example, suicide permits us to reunite with deceased loved ones, allows us those who have been absolved of sin to assure their entrance to heaven, and releases the soul from the bondage of the body. In both Christian and Asian religious traditions, suicide holds the promise of a vision of, or union with, the divine (Pabst Battin 1996, 53-64.)

3.4 Libertarian Views and the Right to Suicide

For libertarians, suicide is morally permissible because individuals enjoy a right to suicide. (It does not of course follow that suicide is necessarily rational or prudent.) Libertarianism, which has historical precedent in the Stoics and in Schopenhauer, is strongly associated with the ‘anti-psychiatry’ movement of the last half century. According to that movement's critics, attempts by the state or by the medical profession to interfere with suicidal behavior are essentially coercive attempts to pathologize morally permissible exercises of individual freedom (Szasz 2002.)

Libertarianism typically asserts that the right to suicide is a right of noninterference, to wit, that others are morally barred from interfering with suicidal behavior. Some assert the stronger claim that the right to suicide is a liberty right, such that individuals have no duty not to commit suicide (i.e., that suicide violates no moral duties), or a claim right, according to which other individuals are morally obliged not only not to interfere with a person's suicidal behavior but are in fact morally required to assist in that suicidal behavior. Our having a claim right to suicide implies that we also have rights of noninterference and of liberty and is a central worry about physician-assisted suicide (Pabst Battin 1996, 163-164.) Since whether we have a liberty right to suicide concerns whether it violates other moral obligations, including obligations to other people, I shall leave discussion of that issue to section 3.5 and focus here on whether there is a right of noninterference.

A popular basis for the claim that we enjoy a right to suicide is the claim that we own our bodies and hence are morally permitted to dispose of them as we wish. (In section 3.3, we observed that some religious arguments for the impermissibility of suicide depend on God's ownership of our bodies.) On this view, our relationship to our bodies is like that of our relationship to other items over which we enjoy property rights: Just as our having a right to a wristwatch permits us to use, improve, and dispose of it as we wish, so too does our having a right to our bodies permit us to dispose of it as we see fit. Consequently, since property rights are exclusive (i.e., our having property rights to a thing prohibits others from interfering with it), others may not interfere with our efforts to end our lives. The notion of self-ownership invoked in this argument is quite murky, since what enables us to own ordinary material items is their metaphysical distinctness from us. We can own a wristwatch only because it is distinct from us, and even under the most dualistic views of human nature, our selves are not sufficiently distinct from our bodies to make ownership of the body by the self a plausible notion. Indeed, the fact that certain ways of treating ordinary property are not available to us as ways of treating our bodies (we cannot give away or sell our bodies in any literal sense) suggests that self-ownership may be only a metaphor meant to capture a deeper moral relationship (Kluge 1975, 119.) In addition, uses of one's property, including its destruction, can be harmful to others. Thus, in cases where suicide may harm others, we may be morally required to refrain from suicide. (See section 3.5 for arguments concerning duties to others)

Another rationale for a right of noninterference is the claim that we have a general right to decide those matters that are most intimately connected to our well-being, including the duration of our lives and the circumstances of our deaths. On this view, the right to suicide follows from a deeper right to self-determination, a right to shape the circumstances of our lives so long as we do not harm or imperil others. As presented in the "death with dignity" movement, the right to suicide is presented as the natural corollary of the right to life. That is, because individuals have the right not to be killed by others, the only person with the moral right to determine the circumstances of a person's death is that person herself and others are therefore barred from trying to prevent a person's efforts at self-inflicted death.

This position is open to at least two objections. First, it does not seem to follow from having a right to life that a person has a right to death, i.e., a right to take her own life. Because others are morally prohibited from killing me, it does not follow that anyone else, including myself, is permitted to kill me. This conclusion is made stronger if the right to life is inalienable, since in order for me to kill myself, I must first renounce my inalienable right to life, which I cannot do (Feinberg 1978.) It is at least possible that no one has the right to determine the circumstances of a person's death! Furthermore, as with the property-based argument, the right to self-determination is presumably circumscribed by the possibility of harm to others.

3.5 Social, Utilitarian, and Role-Based Arguments

A fourth approach to the question of suicide's permissibility asks not whether others may interfere with suicidal behavior but whether we have a liberty right to suicide, whether, that is, suicide violates any moral duties to others. Those who argue that suicide can violate our duties to others generally claim that suicide can harm either specific others (family, friends, etc.) or is a harm to the community as a whole.

No doubt the suicide of a family member or loved one produces a number of harmful psychological and economic effects. In addition to the usual grief, suicide "survivors" confront a complex array of feelings. Various forms of guilt are quite common, such as that arising from (a) the belief that one contributed to the suicidal person's anguish, or (b) the failure to recognize that anguish, or (c) the inability to prevent the suicidal act itself. Suicide also leads to rage, loneliness, and awareness of vulnerability in those left behind. Indeed, the sense that suicide is an essentially selfish act dominates many popular perceptions of suicide (Fedden 1938, 209.) Still, some of these reactions may be due to the strong stigma and shame associated with suicide, in which case these reactions cannot, without logical circularity, be invoked in arguments that suicide is wrong because it produces these psychological reactions (Pabst Battin 1996, 68-69.) Suicide can also cause clear economic or material harm, as when the suicidal person leaves behind dependents unable to support themselves financially. Suicide can therefore be understood as a violation of the distinctive "role obligations" applicable to spouses, parents, and other caretakers. However, even if suicide is harmful to family members or loved ones, this does not support an absolute prohibition on suicide, since some suicides will leave behind few or no survivors, and among those that do, the extent of these harms is likely to differ such that the stronger these relationships are, the more harmful suicide is and the more likely it is to be morally wrong. Besides, from a utilitarian perspective, these harms would have to be weighed against the harms done to the would-be suicide by continuing to live a difficult or painful life. At most, the argument that suicide is a harm to family and to loved ones establishes that it is sometimes wrong.

A second brand of social argument echoes Aristotle in asserting that suicide is harm to the community or the state. One general form such arguments take is that because a community depends on the economic and social productivity of its members, its members have an obligation to contribute to their society, an obligation clearly violated by suicide (Pabst Battin 1996, 70-78.) For example, suicide denies a society the labor provided by its members, or in the case of those with irreplaceable talents such as medicine, art, or political leadership, the crucial goods their talents enable them to provide. Another version states that suicide deprives society of whatever individuals might contribute to society morally (by way of charity, beneficence, moral example, etc.) Still, it is difficult to show that a society has a moral claim on its members' labor, talents, or virtue that compels its members to contribute to societal well-being no matter what. After all, individuals often fail to contribute as much as they might in terms of their labor or special talents without incurring moral blame. It does not therefore seem to be the case that individuals are morally required to benefit society in whatever way they are capable, regardless of the harms to themselves. Again, this line of argument appears to show only that suicide is sometimes wrong, namely, when the benefit (in terms of future harm not suffered) the individual avoids by dying is less than the benefits she would deny to society by dying.

A modification of this argument claims that suicide violates a person's duty of reciprocity to society. On this view, an individual and the society in which she lives stand in a reciprocal relationship such that in exchange for the goods the society has provided to the individual, the individual must continue to live in order to provide her society with the goods that relationship demands. Yet in envisioning the relationship between society and the individual as quasi-contractual in nature, the reciprocity argument reveals its principal flaw: The conditions of this "contract" may not be met, and once met, impose no further obligations upon the parties. If a society fails to fulfill its obligations under the contract, namely to provide individuals with the goods needed for a decent quality of life, then the individual is not morally required to live in order to reciprocate an arrangement that society has already reneged on. As Baron d'Holbach wrote:

If the covenant which unites man to society be considered, it will be obvious that every contract is conditional, must be reciprocal; that is to say, supposes mutual advantages between the contracting parties. The citizen cannot be bound to his country, to his associates, but by the bonds of happiness. Are these bonds cut asunder? He is restored to liberty. Society, or those who represent it, do they use him with harshness, do they treat him with injustice, do they render his existence painful?… Chagrin, remorse, melancholy, despair, have they disfigured to him the spectacle of the universe? In short, for whatever cause it may be, if he is not able to support his evils, let him quit a world which from thenceforth is for him only a frightful desert. (d'Holbach 1970, 136-137)

Moreover, once an individual has discharged her obligations under this societal contract, she no longer is under an obligation to continue her life. Hence, the aged or others who have already made substantial contributions to societal welfare would be morally permitted to commit suicide under this argument.

To this point, we have addressed arguments that concern whether a moral permission to engage in suicidal behavior exists. Yet the social arguments against suicide are fundamentally consequentialist, and some act-utilitarians have discussed the correlative possibility that the good consequences of suicide might so outweigh its bad consequences as to render suicide admirable or even morally obligatory (Cosculluela 1995, 76-81.) In fact, in some cases, suicide may be honorable. Suicides that are clearly other-regarding, aiming at protecting the lives or well-being of others, or at political protest, may fall into this category (Kupfer 1990,73-74.) Examples of this might include the grenade-jumping solider mentioned earlier, or the spy who takes his life in order not to be subjected to torture that will lead to his revealing vital military secrets. Utilitarians have given particular attention to the question of end-of-life euthanasia, suggesting that at the very least, those with painful terminal illnesses have a right to voluntary euthanasia (Glover 1990, chs. 14-15, Singer 1993, ch. 7.) Yet utilitarian views hold that we have a moral duty to maximize happiness, from which it follows that when an act of suicide will produce more happiness than will remaining alive, then that suicide is not only morally permitted, but morally required. Critics worry that a moral requirement to commit suicide raises the sinister and totalitarian prospect that individuals may be obliged to commit suicide against their wishes. (Moreland & Geisler 1990, 94, Pabst Battin 1996, 94-95) This worry may reflect an implicit acceptance of a variation of the sanctity of life view (see section 3.2) or may reflect concerns about infringements upon individual's autonomy (see section 3.6). One alternative for utilitarians is to adopt a rule-utilitarian standpoint according to which suicide would be morally forbidden because general adherence to a rule prohibiting suicide would produce better overall consequences than would general adherence to a rule permitting suicide (Brandt 1975, Pabst Battin 1996, 96-98.)

3.6 Autonomy, Rationality, and Responsibility

A more restricted version of the claim that we have a right to noninterference regarding suicide holds that suicide is permitted so long as — leaving aside questions of duties to others — it is rationally chosen, or to put it in a Kantian vernacular, if it is undertaken autonomously. This position is narrower than the libertarian view, in that it permits suicide only when performed on a rational basis and permits others to interfere when it is not performed on that basis.

This approach has given rise to a rich philosophical literature concerning the conditions for rational suicide. For the most part, this literature divides the conditions for rational suicide into cognitive conditions, conditions ensuring that individuals' appraisals of their situation are rational and well-informed, and interest conditions, conditions ensuring that suicide in fact accords with individuals' considered interests. Richard Brandt captures the spirit of this approach:

The person who is contemplating suicide is obviously making a choice between future world-courses: the world-course that includes his demise, say, an hour from now, and several possible ones that contain his demise at a later point… The basic question a person must answer in order to determine which world-course is best or rational for him to choose, is which he would choose under conditions of optimal use of information, when all of his desires are taken into account. It is not just a question of what we prefer now, with some clarification of all the possibilities being considered. Our preferences change, and the preferences of tomorrow are just as legitimately taken into account in deciding what to do now as the preferences of today (Brandt 1975.)

Other examples of this approach include Glenn Graber, who states that a suicide is rationally justified "if a reasonable appraisal of the situation reveals that one is better off dead." (Graber 1981, 65.) An appraisal is reasonable, according to Graber, if one judges rationally about the likelihood of her present and probable future values and preferences being satisfied. On Graber's view, a suicide is rational if it results from a clearheaded assessment of how suicide would further or impede one's overall interests. Margaret Battin identifies three cognitive conditions for rational suicide (a facility for causal and inferential reasoning, possession of a realistic world view, and adequacy of information relevant to one's decision), along with two interest conditions (that dying enables one to avoid future harms, and that dying accords with one's most fundamental interests and commitments) (Pabst Battin 1996, 115.)

For the most part, suicidal individuals do not manifest signs of systemic irrationality, much the less the signs of legally definable insanity, (Radden 1982) and with the exception of severe psychopaths, engage in suicidal conduct voluntarily. However, these facts are consistent with the choice to engage in suicidal behavior being irrational, and serious questions can be raised about just how often the conditions for rational suicide are met in actual cases of self-inflicted death. Indeed, the possibility of rational suicide requires that certain assumptions about suicidal individuals' rational autonomy be true which may not be in many cases. A person's choice to undertake suicidal behavior may not be a reflection of her true self and her self-inflicted death could be an act that she would, in calmer and clearer moments, recoil at. In other words, even if there is a right to self-determination which in turn implies a right to suicide, it seems to imply a right to commit suicide only when one's true self is making that determination, and there are numerous factors that may compromise a person's rational autonomy and hence make the decision to engage in suicidal behavior not a reflection of one's considered values or aims. Some of these factors cognitively distort agents' deliberation about whether to commit suicide. The act of suicide is often impulsive and poorly thought out, reflecting the intense psychological vulnerability of suicidal persons and their proclivity toward volatility and agitation (Cholbi 2002.) Suicidal persons can also have difficulty fully acknowledging the finality of their death, believing that (assuming there is no afterlife) they will continue to be subjects of conscious experience after they die. In what are known as dyadic suicides, the suicidal individual actually looks forward to the moment when she will (posthumously) enjoy having insulted or having exacted revenge upon another person.

Particularly worrisome is the evident link between suicidal thoughts and mental illnesses such as depression. While disagreement continues about the strength of this link (Pabst Battin 1996, 5) little doubt exists that the presence of depression or other mood disorders greatly increases the likelihood of suicidal behavior. Some studies of suicide indicate that over 90% of suicidal persons displayed symptoms of depression before death, while others estimate that suicide is at least 20 times more common among those with clinical depression than in the general population. In cases of suicide linked with depression, individuals' attitudes toward their own death are colored by strongly negative and occasionally distorted beliefs about their life situations (career prospects, relationships, etc.). As Brandt (Brandt 1975) observed, depression can "primitivize one's intellectual processes," leading to poor estimation of probabilities and an irrational focus on present suffering rather than on possible good future states of affairs. The suicidally depressed also exhibit romanticized and grandiose beliefs about the likely effects of their deaths (delusions of martyrdom, revenge, etc.) Furthermore, suicidal persons are often hesitant about their own actions, hoping that others will intervene and signaling to others the hope that they will intervene (Shneidman 1985.) Finally, although repeated suicide attempts by the same individual are common, the impulse to suicidal behavior is often transient and dissipates of its own accord (Blauner 2003.) Taken together, these considerations indicate that, even if there is a right of self-determination, the scope of suicidal conduct that genuinely manifests fully informed and rational self-evaluation may be rare and so only occasionally will suicide be rational or morally permissible, even when excusable because irrational. (Philip Devine has even argued that suicide is necessarily irrational: Because no one has experience of death, a suicidal individual lacks the knowledge needed to judge continued life with its alternative (Devine 1978).) Moreover, if suicide is frequently not an expression of individuals' rational self-determination about their well-being, that suggests that others may have a prima facie reason to interfere with suicidal behavior and so is there is no general right to noninterference. (See section 3.7)

3.7 Duties Toward the Suicidal

With the exception of the libertarian position that each person has a right against others that they not interfere with her suicidal intentions, each of the moral positions on suicide we have addressed so far would appear to justify others intervening in suicidal plans, at least on some occasions. Little justification is necessary for actions that aim to prevent another's suicide but are non-coercive. Pleading with a suicidal individual, trying to convince her of the value of continued life, recommending counseling, etc. are morally unproblematic, since they do not interfere with the individual's conduct or plans except by engaging her rational capacities (Cosculluela 1994, 35, Cholbi 2002, 252.) The more challenging moral question is whether more coercive measures such as physical restraint, medication, deception, or institutionalization are ever justified to prevent suicide and when. In short, the question of suicide intervention is a question of how to justify paternalistic interference.

As mentioned in section 3.6, the impulse toward suicide is often short-lived, ambivalent, and influenced by mental illnesses such as depression. While these facts together do not appear to justify intervening in others' suicidal intentions, they are indicators that the suicide may be undertaken with less than full rationality. Yet given the added fact that death is irreversible, when these factors are present, they justify intervention in others' suicidal plans on the grounds that suicide is not in the individual's interests as they would rationally conceive those interests. We might call this the ‘no regrets' or ‘err on the side of life’ approach to suicide intervention (Martin 1980, Pabst Battin 1996, 141, Cholbi 2002.) Since most situations in which another person intends to kill herself will be ones where we are unsure of whether she is rationally choosing to die, it is better to temporarily prevent "an informed person who is in control of himself from committing suicide" than to do "nothing while, say, a confused person kills himself, especially since, in all likelihood, the would-be suicide could make another attempt if this one were prevented and since the suicidal option is irreversible if successful." (Cosculluela 1994, 40.) Further psychiatric or medical examinations may settle the matter regarding the rationality of the suicidal individual's decision. The coerciveness of the measures used should be proportional to the apparent seriousness of the suicidal person's intention to die.

A neglected aspect of our duties toward the suicidal is the possibility that we may have a moral duty to aid others to commit suicide. (This possibility is directly related to physician-assisted suicide and the larger question of whether the right to suicide is a claim right.) If there are circumstances that justify our intervening to prevent suicide undertaken irrationally or contrary to a person's self-interest, then the same paternalistic rationale would justify our helping to promote or enable those suicides that are rational and in accordance with a person's self-interest. The widespread moral acceptance of aiding others to commit suicide may portend substantial moral perils, as it opens up the possibility that assisted suicide could be vulnerable to various forms of abuse, manipulation, or undue pressure that make an otherwise irrational suicide rational (Pabst Battin 1996, 145-157.) For example, the family members and health care providers of a terminally ill patient might grow weary of the financial or personal burdens of caring for such a patient and decide to provide substandard palliatve care in order to make suicide more attractive to that patient. Hence, by giving license for others to assist in suicides, we may unwittingly permit them to encourage suicides not because those suicides are in fact in the best interests of the individual in question, but because those suicides advance the interests of other people or of institutions. Indeed, a good deal of the apprehension surrrounding physician-assisted suicide arise from worries about whether laws and institutional practices can be formulated that both permit others to aid in rational suicide while also preventing abuses and manipulation.

4. Conclusion

As the foregoing discussion indicates, suicide has been and continues to be a rich field of philosophical investigation. Recent advances in medical technology are responsible for the extensive philosophical attention paid to one kind of suicide, euthanasia or physician-assisted suicide (PAS), while more "run-of-the-mill" suicide motivated by psychological anguish is somewhat overlooked. This is somewhat unfortunate: Euthanasia and physician-assisted suicide raise issues beyond those associated with other suicides, including the allocation of health care resources and the patient-physician relationship. However, many of the same issues and concerns that surround PAS and euthanasia also surround run-of-the mill suicide, and many writers who address the former often disregard the vast literature on the latter.

Not only is suicide worthy of philosophical investigation in its own right, it is source of insight for various philosophical subdisciplines: moral psychology, ethical theory, social and political philosophy, the metaphysics of personhood, free will and action theory. Suicide is also an area where philosophical interests intersect with those of the empirical sciences. The collective efforts of philosophers and others continue to illuminate what has struck many people as the most incomprehensible and most troubling of human behaviors.

Bibliography

1. Historical (pre-1900) Works Cited

2. Works Cited, 1900-Present

3. Further Reading

Other Internet Resources

Related Entries

autonomy: in moral and political philosophy | autonomy: personal | death | euthanasia: voluntary | libertarianism | mental illness | paternalism | well-being