Notes to Christian Wolff
1. The following biographical sketch is largely informed by the account of Wolff's life given by Johann Christoph Gottsched (1700-1766), found in the abstracted “Life of Baron Wolfius” in the English translation of Wolff's Logic or Rational Thoughts on the Powers Of The Human Understanding With Their Use And Application In The Knowledge And Search Of Truth (London, 1720), pp. i-lii. Hereafter, this work will be referred to as Wolff's German Logic.
2. For more discussion of this episode, see Lewis White Beck, Early German Philosophy, (Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 1969) pp. 257-259; Irving Polonoff, Force, Cosmos, Monads and Other Themes of Kant's Early Thought, in Kantsudien Erganzungsheft 107(1973) pp. 70-72; Thomas Saine, “Who's afraid of Christian Wolff?,” in Anticipations of the Enlightenment, edited by A.C. Kors and P. Korshin (Philadelphia, 1987), pp. 102-33; Eric Watkins, “The Development of Physical Influx in Early Eighteenth-Century Germany: Gottsched, Knutzen, and Crusius,” in Review of Metaphysics 49 (1995), pp. 298-300; and Catherine Wilson, “The Reception of Leibniz in the Eighteenth Century,” in The Cambridge Companion to Leibniz, pp. 442-494.
3. See, in particular, James McClellan, Science Reorganized: Scientific Societies in the Eighteenth Century (New York: Columbia University Press, 1985), p. 73.
4. In §70 of his Preliminary Discourse, [1728] 1963, Wolff describes his introduction to Leibniz. He writes: “In 1703 I wrote a treatise on universal practical philosophy, using the mathematical method. I submitted this work to the examination of learned men in public debate at the Leipzig Academy, for the statutes required that an academic specimen be presented by anyone who becomes a private doctor. By this work I first became known to Leibniz, who, after obtaining a copy of it from Johannes Mencke, judged me to be worthy of his favor and friendship. I wrote this work when I was a very young man, imitating some of the recent mathematicians who gave a general treatment of the principles of arithmetic and geometry in a common universal mathematics. In this work I still discover a solid content, even after I have meditated on the theory more profoundly and have scrutinized its reason more deeply….”
5. Gottsched reports: “The same year [1716] Leibniz, on his return from Vienna, where he endeavoured, but in vain, to establish an academy of sciences, came to Halle. This great man, who laid himself out in promoting the happiness of mankind, warmly exhorted Wolff to prosecute his discovery concerning the multiplication of corn. This discovery was made as early as the year 1709, and lay dormant, till Wolff was thus excited by the admonitions of Leibniz” (p. xii). See German Logic, xii.
6. See “Elogium Godofreid Guilielmi Leibnittii.” Acta eruditorum (July 1717), pp. 322-336; and Merckwürdige Schriften wlche… zwischen dem Herrn Baron von Leibniz und dem Herrn D. Clarke über besondere Materien der natürlichen Religion in Französ. und Englischer Sprache gewechselt und …in teutscher Sprache herausgegben worden von Heinrich Köhler [edited by Christian Wolff and L.P. Thümmig] ( Frankfurt and Leipig, 1720).
7. In his article, “Christian Wolff and Leibniz,” Corr reports that the two men meet three times in their lifetime: first in Berlin in 1706 and twice in Halle in 1713 and 1716 (respectively). See footnote # 17 in Charles Corr, “Christian Wolff and Leibniz,” pp. 241-262.
8. See Beck, Early German Philosophy, p 257.
9.Gottsched, “Life of Baron Wolffius” in German Logic, p. viii
10. See G. W. Leibniz and Christian Wolff, Briefwechsel zwischen Leibniz und Christian Wolff, edited by C. I. Gerhardt (Georg Olms Verlagsbuchhandlung Hildesheim, 1963). It should be noted that Gerhardt's edition of the Wolff-Leibniz correspondence omits almost one quarter of the total number of letters (including only 97 of the total 127 letters that remain).
11. Leibniz, Philosophical Papers and Letters, edited by Leroy Loemker (Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers, 1989), 2nd edition, p. 657.
12. Although Wolff published his German Logic in 1712, there is no mention of it by either Leibniz or Wolff in their correspondence. See footnote # 17 in Corr's “Christian Wolff and Leibniz,” p. 247.
13. L. Dutens, Leibnitii opera omnia ( Geneva , 1768). For a discussion of how and why Dutens came to assemble this exact collection of Leibniz's writtings see Roger Ariew, “G. W. Leibniz, life and works” in The Cambridge Companion to Leibniz, p. 40. In short, Dutens was not granted access to Leibniz's manuscripts in Hanover and so assembled the collection from the various journals that Leibniz published in during his life and from the writtings which could be found in libraries throughout France and Italy .
14. Prior to Wolff, Melanchthon's scholastic philosophy was dominant in German universities. For discussions on Melanchthon and his influence on Wolff, see Calinger, “The Newtonian-Wolffian Controversy,” pp 320-321; Charles A. Corr, “Christian Wolff and Leibniz,” pp. 241-262; and Lewis White Beck, Early German Philosophy, pp. 189-194 & 101-110.
15. Part of Wolff's success in reforming the study of philosophy in Germany stems from his position at, and support from, the University of Halle. Unlike many of the older universities in the region which were steeped in orthodoxy and religious conservatism, the University of Halle had been recently founded by Frederick I in 1693, and was much more tolerant of, and even encouraged, secular reform. Christian Thomasius, for example, also a member of the philosophy faculty at Halle, joined Wolff in producing German texts in philosophy. In one respect, Thomasius was perhaps more of a leader in developing a German language philosophy. Thomasius first submitted his treatise on logic, written in German, to the censor in Leipzig in 1689, whereby it was refused for publication. Later, however, after his arrival at Halle, he published the work under the title: Einleitung zu der Vernunfft-Lehre. See Blackall, The Emergence of German as a Literary Language 1700-1775, pp. 19-21.
16. German Logic , p. lxxvii. Wolff's comments on the utility of philosophy can also be seen in his German Logic “Chapter 9,” §18 and in his Preliminary Discourse §12. For further discussion, see Charles A Corr, “Certitude and Utility in the Philosophy of Christian Wolff,” The Southwest Journal of Philosophy (1970), pp. 133-142.
17. During the eighteenth century, philosophy as a academic subject was primarily regarded as part of the undergraduate curriculum, seen as preparation for the professional disciplines of theology, law, and medicine. A German professor of philosophy typically lectured on several sub-disciplines, such as logic, metaphysics, ethics, as well as physics, politics, economics, grammar and rhetoric. For a general discussion, see Friedrich Paulsen, The German Universities and University Study, translated by F. Thilly and W. Elwang (New York: Charles Scribner's Sons, 1906).
18. Wolff's most explicit discussion of these three types of knowledge is presented in “Chapter One” of his Preliminary Discourse and is aptly titled: “The Three Types of Human Knowledge: History, Philosophy and Mathematics.”
19. Richard Blackwell provides a helpful discussion on the differences between Descartes' discovery of the cogito and Wolff's empirical argument for the soul in his article, “Christian Wolff's Doctrine of the Soul,” pp. 339-354.
20. German Metaphysics §1: “Wir sind uns unserer und anderer Dinge bewust, daran kan niemand zweiffeln, der nicht seiner Sinnen völlig beraubet ist; und wer es leugnen wolte, derjenige würde mit dem Munde anders vorgeben.” [My translation]
21. German Metaphysics §5: “1. Wir erfahren unwidersprechlich, dasz wir uns unserer und anderer Dinge selbst bewust sind. 2. Es ist uns klar, dasz derjenige ist, der sich seiner und anderer Dinge bewust ist. Und daher ist uns 3 gewisz, dasz wir sind…” [My translation]
22. Charles Corr has examined the role of certainty in Wolff's philosophy in both his article: “Certitude and Utility in the Philosophy of Christian Wolff” and his Ph.D dissertation: Order and Method in Christian Wolff's Philosophy (Saint Louis University, 1966) pp. 125-155 & 223-262.
23. German Logic , “Author's Short View of the Following Logical Treatise,” p. lxxxli.
24. For Wolff's definitions of distinct see § 13, Chapter 1, of his German Logic; and §206 & §§276-282 in the German Metaphysics.
25. See, for example, German Logic, “The Author's Short View,” pp. ixxiii-lxxiv.
26. This passage from Wolff's German Metaphysics is translated by Lewis White Beck, taken from Beck's 18th-Century Philosophy (New York: The Free Press, 1966), p. 222.
27. See (especially), §§132-135 of the Preliminary Discourse.
28. Wolff discusses the order and parts of the human sciences (explicitly) in his Preliminary Discourse §§55-114.
29. In §§94-95 of the Preliminary Discourse, Wolff writes: “If everything is to be demonstrated accurately in physics, then principles must be borrowed from metaphysics. Physics explains those things which are possible through bodies (§59). If these things are to be treated demonstratively, then the notions of body, matter, nature, motion, the elements, and other such general notions must be known. For such notions contain the reason of many things. Now these notions are explained in general cosmology and in ontology (§§73,78). Therefore, if all things are to be demonstrated accurately in physics, principles must be borrowed from general cosmology and ontology… .Thus it is clear that metaphysics must precede physics…“
30. Examples of such passages include the German Logic, Chapter 16, §3: “Man ‘tis true, has a natural aptitude or disposition to produce the operations of the Understanding, and Rules are prescribed to it, by which it regulates itself, without understanding them; just as Bodies move by certain rules or laws, and a Man, in walking, and in other Motions, observes a set of Rules, which he does not understand. The Rules prescribed by God to the Understanding, and the natural Aptitude to act accordingly, constitute the natural Logic…”; and the Theologia naturalis §64: “The visible world, the elements of material things and human souls are all beings by another and hence have the sufficient reason for their existence only in an ens a se [or God].” [Passages translated and quoted in Emmanuel Sullivan's Ph.D dissertation, Christian Wolff's Concept of the Possible (Catholic University, 1971), p. 115.]
31. See, for example, Preliminary Discourse, §139.
32. See, for example, German Logic, “Chapter 1,” §39.
33. See Preliminary Discourse, §62 & §92 and also the “The Author's Short View” of the German Logic, p. lxvi.
34. See Preliminary Discourse, §92
35. For a helpful discussion on the “pure” and “empirical” division in Wolff's conception of theoretical philosophy, see Tonelli, “The Problem of the Classification of the Sciences in Kant's Time,” pp. 247-250.
36. German Logic , “Preliminary Discourse,” §1. In the §29 of the Preliminary Discourse, Wolff gives a brief autobiographical account of how he came to formulate his definition of philosophy. What is significant in this account is that Wolff tells us that it was while attending a seminar at the Leipzig Academy (under the instruction of von Tschirnhaus) that he first formulated his definition. In this respect, von Tschirnhaus (particularly with his theory of the conceivable and the possible) should be seen as direct influence on the development of Wolff's philosophical views. For a brief account of the philosophy of von Tschirnhaus, see Beck, Early German Philosophy, pp. 189-195.
37. See §54 & §55 of Wolff's Philosophia prima sive ontologia, methodo scientifica pertractata, qua omnis cognitionis humanae principia continentur [1730], editio Nova-Priori Emendatior (Frankfurt and Leipzig: Officina Libraria Rengeriana, 1736). [Hereafter this work will be cited as Ontologia].
38. The translation of this passage is taken from Corr's Order and Method in Christian Wolff's Philosophy, p. 242.
39. In §100 of the Ontologia, Wolff writes: “The notion of the impossible which is that which involves a contradiction, and the notion of the possible which is that which is free from contradiction is conformable to the practice of the Mathematicians.” [Passage cited and translated in John Burn's Dynamism in the Cosmology of Christian Wolff: A Study in Pre-Critical Rationalism (New York: Exposition Press, 1966), pp. 20-21.
40. In my discussion of Wolff's notion of possible things I take the term “thing” to include events or occurrences and the term “object” to include states-of-affairs. No harm should come of this.
41. Manfred Kuehn discusses this point in his article “The Wolffian Background of Kant's Transcendental Deduction,” in Logic and the Workings of the Mind: The Logic of Ideas and Faculty Psychology in Early Modern Philosophy, vol. 5 of the North American Kant Society Studies in Philosophy (Atascadero, CA.: Ridgeview Publishing Company, 1997), p. 232.
42. Wolff provides concise definitions of “possible” and “possible thing” in his Ontologia. In §135, he writes: “That which does not involve a contradiction, and what is possible is a being.” [Passage cited and translated in John Burn's Dynamism in the Cosmology of Christian Wolff, pp. 20-21.]
43. See Ontologia , §57, §59, and §60. For discussion and commentary, see Gurr, The Principle of Sufficient Reason in Some Scholastic Systems 1750-1900, (Milwaukee: The Marquette University Press, 1959), pp. 38-39.
44. In §57 of the Ontologia, Wolff writes: “We call that nothing to which no notion corresponds…. Something is that to which some notion corresponds.” [Translation taken from Corr's Order and Method in Christian Wolff's Philosophy, p. 251.]
45. In §174 of his Ontologia, Wolff describes existence as “the complement of possibility,” that is, existence is the completing determination or predicate of a possible thing that brings it into actual reality. For a brief discussion of this aspect of Wolff's thought, see Burns, Dynamism in the Cosmology of Christian Wolff, pp. 28-29.
46. This passage is translated and cited in Sullivan's Christian Wolff's Concept of the Possible, p. 27.
47. Passage translated and cited in Corr's Order and Method in Christian Wolff's Philosophy, p. 249.
48. For Leibniz, “necessary truths of reasons” are defined in terms of the Principle of Contradiction and “contingent truths of fact,” in contrast, are defined in terms of the Principle of Sufficient Reason. Contingent truths of fact include existing things, save God, and pertain (in general) to created reality. Leibniz's most explicit comments on the Principle of Sufficient Reason appear in the Monadology, in the Clarke-Leibniz Correspondence, and Primary Truths. For a helpful discussion on Leibniz's view of the Principle of Sufficient Reason and especially how it differs from Wolff's, see Gurr, The Principle of Sufficient Reason in Some Scholastic Systems 1750-1900, pp. 21-49.
49. See §72, §73, and §74 of Wolff's Ontologia. For discussion, see Gurr, The Principle of Sufficient Reason in Some Scholastic Systems 1750-1900, pp. 41-42; and Corr, Order and Method in Christian Wolff's Philosophy, p. 258.
50. In a manner foreshadowing Kant, Wolff here essentially offers a transcendental argument for the existence of PSR. For a discussion of how Kant appropriates transcendental-style arguments from Wolff, see (Kuehn 1997, 229-250).
51. For Wolff's discussion of the Principle of Excluded Middle and the Principle of Certitude, see (respectively), §§52-54 and §55 of his Ontologia. A clear discussion of the Principle of Conceptual Implication appears in “Chapter 4,” §§2-5 of the German Logic. Wolff writes: “§2. This manner of concluding [viz. by means of a syllogism] is extremely evident … [and is] … grounded on this [two-fold] principle; namely, that whatever agrees with a genus or species, must agree with all the particulars contained under that genus or species… [and] … whatever is denied of a whole genus or species, must also be denied of every particular contained under that genus or species…. §5. If we therefore more accurately consider these two principles (§2 and §4) of Syllogisms, it will be seen that we therefore assume them, as we would otherwise grant, that the same thing may be and not be at the same time: And therefore, the [sufficient] reason of the truth and evidence of Syllogisms, is the Principle of Contradiction, whereby we pronounce it impossible for the same thing to be and not to be at the same time.”
52. Wolff's derivation of PSR is translated into English in the endnotes to Kant's Lectures on Metaphysics, p. 564. [The emphasis in this passage is my own.] Baumgarten also give a proof of PSR from POC in §23 of his Metaphysica.
53. For discussions of the subtleties of this argument, see Corr, Order and Method in Christian Wolff's Philosophy, pp. 253-262; and Sullivan, Christian Wolff's Concept of the Possible, pp. 60-69 & 167-173.
54. In Kant's Lectures on Metaphysics [1997], Mrongovius reports the following critique of Baumgarten's proof of PSR from POC: “[Baumgarten] has proven it, but rather remarkably, namely: if a thing were to have no ground, then its ground would be nothing. Then nothing would be the ground of something, but that is a contradiction. He has here confused the logical and metaphysical nothing, which is hardly pardonable. One can easily refute this proof if one parodies it, that is, proves something absurd from it, e.g., you have money in the chest- for if you did not have that, then there would be nothing of money in the chest, then nothing would be money, thus you must have money. The mistake is that nothing <nihil> is meant one time as negation, another time as a concept. It is not the same whether I say: nothing is without a ground, or nothing is a ground….” (AK 29:816). Baumgarten's proof appears in §23 of his Metaphysica. Hereafter (and when possible), all references and citations to Kant's works will be to the Berlin Academy's pagination.
55. For examples of how Wolff attempts to “demonstrate” empirical truths, see “Chapter 4” of his German Logic.
56. It should also be noted that the early Kant also believed POC to be innate to the human mind. In his New Elucidation, he writes: “For the mind, even if it is not instructed as to the existence of … [the POC] … cannot but employ it everywhere, doing so spontaneously and in virtue of a certain necessity of its nature” (AK 1:391).
57. See, for example, Kant's New Elucidation (AK 1:398); and his Negative Magnitudes (AK 2:203).
58. See, for example, “The Postulates of Empirical Thought,” in the first Critique (B 265-87); and “On method in metaphysics concerning what is sensitive and what belongs to the understanding,” in the InauguralDissertation (AK 2:411).
59. See Ontologia, §174.
60. In §148 of his Metaphysica, Baumgarten expresses this idea as the "Principle of Thoroughgoing Determination." For Kant's discussion of this principle in the first Critique, see B 599. One clear statement of this principle is provided by Moses Mendelssohn in his Philosophische Schriften. Mendelssohn writes: "One might simply recall, from the first principles of metaphysics, that a subject matter actually exist as soon as everything determinable in it is in fact determined, that is to say, as soon as everything determinable in it is in fact determined… Herein lies the characteristic difference between general possible concepts and real individuals. In the former neither the affirmation nor the negation of several determinacies is established, but instead left undecided, and they can be determined in one manner as well as another. In the case of individual real things, by contrast, the affirmation or negation of everything that can be affirmed or denied must be established and decided and, conversely, that of which everything down to the most remote relations is established and decided, actually exists. What is not actual must, therefore, be either indeterminable or indeterminate. In the first case, it contains a contradiction and is impossible. In the latter case, there is no reason by which it can be understood how and why it is supposed to be determined in one way rather than another. That is to say, there is a lack of efficient causes which are supposed to produce the possible thing. For "an efficient cause" means nothing else but that through which a possible thing receives all the determinations of it which were lacking for actual existence" [Moses Mendelssohn: Philosophical Writings, edited by Daniel Dahlstrom (New York: Cambridge University Press, 1997), p.282].
61. In “Chapter One,” §15 of the German Logic, Wolff writes: “A notion [or being] is complete, when the characters or marks assigned, are sufficient to distinguish the thing at all times from all the other things. On the contrary, incomplete, if we cannot repeat all the marks or characters, or but a few only, whereby one thing is distinguished from another….”
62. In §168 of the Ontologia, Wolff writes: “Essence is that which is conceived of a being in the first place, and in which is to be found the sufficient reason why all the rest either actually belongs to it or is able to belong to it. [This passage is cited and translated into English in Burn's Dynamism in the Cosmology of Christian Wolff, p. 23.] The example used by Wolff to explain the difference between essentials and attributes involves an equilateral triangle. The essentials of an equilateral triangle are its triple number and equality of sides. These properties are what are conceived in an equilateral triangle “in the first place” and from them all other properties of the equilateral triangle can be deduced (as attributes) or be shown to be possible (as modes). The property of having equal angles, follows from (or are determined by) the essentials and are considered to be attributes. The property of having sides three feet long, however, is only a contingent property of the equilateral triangle and is thereby considered to be a mode. See §145, of Wolff's Ontologia; and, for discussion, Burn's Dynamism in the Cosmology of Christian Wolff, p. 25.
63. See Ontologia, §866.
64. Wolff not only employs PSR to derive particular metaphysical truths, such as the existence of simples and the existence of God, but he also uses it to justify the very enterprize of metaphysics (or philosophy as a science). In §37 of the Preliminary Discourse, he writes: “There need be no fear that philosophy as we have defined it is impossible…Things which are or occur are not without a reason from which it is understood why they are or occur (§ 4). Hence, it is not impossible that there be a science which explains the reasons why those things which exist and occur can exist and occur, and why in a given case this rather than that occurs. And since this science is philosophy (§§31,32), it is clear that philosophy is not impossible…” [my emphasis].
65. In this connection, it is perhaps interesting to note that in both his German Logic and Preliminary Discourse, Wolff refers to Locke and Newton twice as much as he does to Descartes and Leibniz. Although it is beyond the focus of this present article, I believe tracing the influence of Locke on Wolff would be a worthwhile project in its own right. The only article that I know of which addresses this general theme is Klaus Fischer's “John Locke in the German Enlightenment: An Interpretation” in The Journal of the History of Ideas, 36 (1975), pp. 431-446.
66. Like Kant, there is an important sense in which historical knowledge grounds philosophical knowledge. For example, in his Preliminary Discourse, Wolff writes in §10: “Historical knowledge provides the foundation for philosophical knowledge insofar as experience establishes those things from which reason can be given for other things which are and occur, or can occur. Things which are established by experience are known by historical knowledge. And if from this you discover the reason of other things which are and occur, you have built up philosophical knowledge. Therefore history is the foundation of philosophical knowledge.” In claiming that history is the “foundation” of philosophical knowledge it is perhaps puzzling that Wolff has been traditionally labeled as a rationalist. When commenting on this very aspect of Wolff's thought, Lewis White Beck writes: “Sometimes he seems to be an empiricist masquerading as a rationalist, sometimes as a rationalist disguising himself as an empiricist” (Beck, Early German Philosophy, p. 267). However, even though experience may serve as a foundation for Wolff, he nonetheless dogmatically champions reason and understanding as the keys to philosophical certainty.
67. Translations of these passages are taken from Beck's 18th-Century Philosophy, pp. 218-221.
68. In §121 of his Cosmologia Generalis, Methodo Scientifica Pertractata, Qua ad Solidam, Inprimis Dei atque Naturae, Cognitionem via Stemitur, (Verona: Typis Dionysii Ramanzini Bibliopolae Apud S. Thomam, 1736) [Hereafter, this work will be referred to as Cosmologia]. Wolff writes: “Because bodies are composite beings, to bodies are able to be applied all those things which have been demonstrated of composite beings in First Philosophy.” [Passage cited and translated in Burns Dynamism in the Cosmology of Christian Wolff, p 44].
69. Passage cited and translated in Burns Dynamism in the Cosmology of Christian Wolff, p 45.
70. Burns stresses this same point in his Dynamism in the Cosmology of Christian Wolff, p. 44.
71. See Etienne Gilson, Being and Some Philosophers, 2nd edition (Toronto: Pontifical Institute of Mediaeval Studies, 1952), p. 114.
72. This point is stressed by both Gilson and Burns. See Gilson, Being and Some Philosophers, p. 115; and Burns, Dynamism in Christian Wolff's Cosmology, p. 26.
73. See §148 of Wolff's Ontologia.
74. This passage is cited and translated in Burns's Dynamism in the Cosmology of Christian Wolff, p. 51.
75. German Metaphysics , §544: “daß die Welt eine Reihe veränderlicher Dinge sind, und auf einander folgen, insgesamt aber mit einander verknüpfet sind.” The translation of this passage is taken from Eric Watkins in his dissertation: Kant's Third Analogy of Experience (Nortre Dame, 1994), p. 88.
76. In Kant's Lectures on Metaphysics, the metaphysical (or dynamical) explanation of bodies is contrasted with the mechanical at AK 28:210 & AK 29: 935
77. See, for example, Friedrich Baumeister, Elementa Philosophiae Recentioris (Leipzig: Gleditschii, 1747), p. 226.
78. Other commentators who mention the interactive quality of Wolff's atomic elements include: Beck, Early German Philosophy, p. 271; Johann Erdmann, The History of Philosophy, vol. 2, translated by Williston Hough (New York: Macmillan & Co., 1897), pp. 224-226; Burns, Dynamism in the Cosmology of Christian Wolff, p. 99; and Guyer, “Wolff” in The Cambridge Dictionary of Philosophy, edited by Robert Audi (New York: Cambridge University Press, 1995), p. 860.
79. This passage is cited and translated in Burns's Dynamism in the Cosmology of Christian Wolff, p. 86.
80. This passage is cited and translated in Burns's Dynamism in the Cosmology of Christian Wolff, p. 42.
81. This passage is cited and translated in Burns's Dynamism in the Cosmology of Christian Wolff, p. 52.
82. This passage is cited and translated in Burns's Dynamism in the Cosmology of Christian Wolff, p. 80. The idea that extension is a secondary quality, on the same level as colors, is a view also expressed by the Wolffian, Moses Mendelssohn, in his Philosophische Schriften (in Dahlstrom's edition) p. 290.
83. This passage is cited and translated in Burns's Dynamism in the Cosmology of Christian Wolff, p. 80.
84. Locke presents a detailed account of his primary/secondary quality distinction in Book II, Chapter VIII, §§9-26 of his Essay Concerning Human Understanding. For a helpful discussion on Locke's primary/secondary quality distinction, especially how it contrasts with this same distinction in Descartes and Galileo, see Edwin McCann, “Locke's philosophy of body” in The Cambridge Companion to Locke, edited by Vere Chappell (New York: Cambridge University Press, 1997), pp. 56-88.
85. In §191 of his Cosmologia, Wolff states: “In the [atomic] elements are contained the ultimate reasons of that which is perceived in material things.” [Passage is cited and translated in Burns's Dynamism in the Cosmology of Christian Wolff, p. 83].
86.See §§122-124 of Wolff's Cosmologia. For discussion, see Burns, Dynamism in the Cosmology of Christian Wolff, pp. 43 & 51.
87. See Wolff's Ontologia §§ 676-679 and Burns, Dynamism in the Cosmology of Christian Wolff, p. 43.
88. In §45 and §46, German Metaphysics. Wolff writes: “Wenn wir auf uns acht haben; so werden wir finden, daß wir uns vieler Dinge als außer uns bewußt sind. Wir setzen sie aber außer uns, in dem wir erkennen, daß sie von uns unterschieden sind: gleichwie sie auch außer einander setzen, indem wir erkennen, daß sie von einander unterschieden sind…. Indem nun viele Dinge, die zugleich sind und deren eines das andere nicht ist, als außer einander vorgestellet werden; so entstehet dadurch unter ihnen eine gewisse Ordnung. Und so bald wir uns diese Ordnung vorstellen; stellen wir uns den Raum vor. Daher, wenn wir die Sache nicht anders ansehen wollen, als wie wir sie erkennen; so müssen wir den Raum für die Ordnung derer Dinge annehmen, die zugleich sind.” [My translation].
89. For a discussion of the subjective character of Wolffian-space, see Beck, Early German Philosophy, p. 270.
90. For a similar analysis of Wolff's theory of time, see Beck, Early German Philosophy, p. 270.
91.See footnote # 17 in Kant's Lectures to Metaphysics, p. 605.
92. Johann Heinrich Lambert, “Letter to Kant dated 1770 October 13” in Kant: Philosophical Correspondence 1759-99, p. 63.
93. For a helpful discussion on the Wolffian theory of time, and especially how it contrasts with Kant's subjective theory, see Lorne Falkenstein, “Kant, Mendelssohn, Lambert and the Subjectivity of Time,” The Journal of the History of Philosophy 29 (1991), pp. 227-251.
94. It is an interesting question whether for Wolff simple substances at the nominal level of reality in any sense change and thus can be considered to be “in time.”
95. See Wolff's Cosmologia §789; and for discussion Burns, Dynamism in the Cosmology of Christian Wolff, p 52.
96. This definition of the world is repeated frequently in Kant's Lectures on Metaphysics. For examples, see AK 28: 195-198; AK 29: 848-864; and AK 29: 10006-10009. What I am calling here the "interconnection-thesis" is referred to by Baumgarten as the "Principle of Thoroughgoing Connection." See Baumgarten's Metaphysica, §357 and Kant's Lectures on Metaphysics, AK 29:853.
97. See Blackwell, "Christian Wolff's Doctrine of the Soul," 347-348.
98. For a helpful discussion, see Watkins, “The Development of Physical Influx in Early Eighteenth-Century Germany: Gottsched, Knutzen, and Crusius,” 295-339.
99. As cited in Corr, “The Existence of God, Natural Theology, and Christian Wolff,” 109-110.
100. For discussion of this argument and other aspects of Wolff's theology see James Collins, God in Modern Philosophy, 133-143.
101. As cited in Corr, “The Existence of God, Natural Theology, and Christian Wolff,” 115.
102. See, for example, Leibniz's letter to Countess Elizabeth "On God and Formal Logic" in G.W. Leibniz: Philosophical Essays (Leibniz 1989, 238).
103. Much of the following bibliography of Wolff's German and Latin texts is taken from Walford's bibliography in The Cambridge Edition of the Works of Immanuel Kant: Theoretical Philosophy: 1755-1770 (Kant 1992, 522-523).