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Used more broadly and more loosely, the term "skepticism" is sometimes used in conjunction with many ancient thinkers who are not tied to these two movements, but are characterized by significant skeptical inclinations. Thinkers of this sort include Gorgias, Protagoras, Socrates, Aristippus and Diogenes of Sinope. While their views are sometimes mentioned in the present article, it focuses on the narrow notion of "ancient skepticism" and the figures and schools that it encompasses.
Sextus Empiricus describes Pyrrhonean skepticism's relationship to other ancient philosophies in the opening passage of his Outlines of Pyrrhonism.
When people search for something, the likely outcome is that either they find it or, not finding it, they accept that it cannot be found, or they continue to search. So also in the case of what is sought in philosophy, I think, some people have claimed to have found the truth, others have asserted that it cannot be apprehended, and others are still searching. Those who think that they have found it are the Dogmatists, properly so called -- for example, the followers of Aristotle and Epicurus, the Stoics, and certain others. The followers of Cleitomachus and Carneades, as well as other Academics, have asserted that it cannot be apprehended. The Skeptics [skeptikoi] continue to search. (PH (The Outlines of Pyrrhonism) 1.1-3, Mates)Two aspects of these remarks warrant special comment. One is Sextus' suggestion that the Pyrrhonian leaves open the possibility of apprehending truth. While consistency forces him to speak this way -- for the skeptic must admit that skepticism, like all other views, may be mistaken -- one might reasonably wonder whether the ancient skeptic was genuinely open to this possibility. Certainly it must be said that the Pyrrhonean stance one finds in Sextus is an overwhelmingly negative one which functions primarily as a negative critique of any attempt to establish truth.
Sextus' comments on Carneades, Clitomachus and other Academic skeptics are also controversial. His suggestion that they maintain that truth cannot be apprehended (which implies that they inconsistently maintain that this is true) is most plausibly interpreted as an attempt to drive a wedge between Pyrrhonism and a competing school of skepticism. In the present context, it is enough to say that these Academics are skeptics in the sense in which we use the term even if they adopt the negative dogmatism Sextus which ascribes to them, for it still constitutes a comprehensive rejection of our ability to apprehend what is true.
The conviction that claims to truth are inherently uncertain is, therefore, the heart of ancient skepticism. This conviction is propounded and defended by opposing any and all positions with contrary positions which are said to demonstrate their uncertainty. Sextus describes the "method of antithesis" this implies when he explains later Pyrrhonism's practice of epoche (suspending judgment):
Broadly speaking, this [suspension of judgement about all things] comes about because of the setting of things in opposition. We oppose either appearances to appearances, or ideas to ideas, or appearances to ideas. We oppose appearances to appearances when we say `The same tower seems round from a distance but square from near by.' We oppose ideas to ideas when someone establishes the existence of providence from the orderliness of the things in the heavens and we oppose to this the frequency with which the good fare badly and the bad prosper, thereby deducing the non-existence of providence. We oppose ideas to appearances in the way in which Anaxagoras opposed to snow's being white the consideration: snow is water, and water is black, therefore snow is black too. On a different scheme, we oppose sometimes present things to present things, but sometimes present things to past and future things... (PH 1.31-5, Long & Sedley)Diogenes Laertius associates a similar kind of antithesis with Academic skepticism when he writes that Arcesilaus "was the originator of the Middle Academy, being the first to suspend his assertions owing to the contrarities of arguments, and the first to argue pro and contra" (4.28-44, Long & Sedley). The most famous of the Academic skeptics, Carneades, is reported to have demonstrated his ability to argue for opposing views on a famous trip to Rome, where he is said to have argued impressively for justice on one day and on the next to have argued with equal force against it (Lactantius, Div. Ins., 5.16, 6.6). Judging by Cicero's account in De Finibus, the attitude of opposition which this reflects played an integral role in lessons in the skeptical Academy, where the teacher proceeded by opposing a thesis enunciated by a student (e.g., "The Chief Good in my opinion is pleasure"). In a more technical way, antithesis is evident in the Academics' argument against "cataleptic" impressions, which paired such impresssions with equally forceful impressions which are false.
We can recognize the emphasis on opposition and antithesis which characterized ancient skepticism by describing it as a rejection of our ability to apprehend truth which was founded on the attempt to oppose other philosophies, both by opposing their arguments and positions, and by devising general strategies of opposition.
Skepticism's affinity to other ancient philosophies is most evident in the kinds of considerations that convince the skeptic that he should suspend judgment on the truth of any claim. For though skeptical conclusions are at odds with the "dogmatist" philosophies the skeptics criticize, these philosophies were frequently founded on a similar concern with opposition, antithesis, and opposing points of view. One might, for example, easily compare the Pyrrhonean conviction that there are equally convincing arguments for and against any claim and the Protagorean conviction that one can argue convincingly on both sides of any question. This similarity reflects similar philosophical concerns even though Protagoras' conclusion that opposing points of view are true is diametrically at odds with the skeptic's rejection of all claims to truth.
The situation is similar in many other cases. Opposing points of view played, for example, an important role in the development of Greek atomism, which can be seen as an attempt to explain such opposition by hypothesizing atoms which impact on different kinds of bodies in different kinds of ways. Opposites which include opposing points of view are also emphasized in Heracleitan and Platonic metaphysics. Even Aristotle recognized the possibility of arguing for conflicting points of view in his account of rhetoric.
In other cases, ancient philosophers anticipated skepticism by stressing the difficulties inherent in the search for truth. Xenophanes was known for his claim that no one can know clear truth. Democritus maintained that "bastard" knowledge gained through our senses exists only by convention. Plato rejected everyday opinions, comparing them to shadows in a cave. Diogenes of Sinope, Epictetus and similar moralists dismiss philosophical speculation on the grounds that practical demonstration is what matters. Such philosophers did not endorse a full fledged skepticism, but their views clearly added impetus to the skeptics' moves in this direction.
Much more generally, ancient skepticism fourished in a historical context which is conducive to skeptical conclusions. In marked contrast with modern science, ancient science did not boast the kinds of practical and theoretical successes we now take for granted. In part because of this, a bewildering array of opposing philosophical perspectives characterized ancient philosophical inquiry. Important philosophers were famous for their ability to construct dazzling arguments for paradoxical conclusions (that motion is impossible, that nothing exists, that time is an illusion, etc.). Much more generally, an interest in foreign cultures drew attention to opposing customs and traditions, mysticism and irrationalism flourished as powerful cultural forces, and opposing social forces and perspectives were manifest in war, political rivalries and a religion and mythology which pitted god against god, man against man and even god against man. In the midst of all the opposition this implies, it cannot be judged surprising that various kinds of radical skepticism became popular philosophical perspectives.
He [Pyrrho] himself has left nothing in writing, but this pupil Timon says that whoever wants to be happy must consider these three questions: first, how are things by nature? Secondly, what attitude should we adopt towards them? Thirdly, what will be the outcome for those who have such an attitude? According to Timon, Pyrrho declared that things are equally indifferent, unmeasurable and inarbitrable. For this reason neither our sensations nor our opinions tell us truths or falsehoods. Therefore for this reason we should not put our trust in them one bit, but should be unopinionated, uncommitted and unwavering, saying concerning each individual thing that it no more is than is not, or both is and is not, or neither is nor is not. The outcome for those who actually adopt this attitude, says Timon, will be first speechlessness [aphasia], and then freedom from disturbance; and Aenesidemus says pleasure. (Eusebius, Prep. Ev. 14.18.2-5, Long & Sedley)According to Diogenes Laertius (9.76), Timon explained Pyrrho's formula ou mallon ("no more is than not") as a decision to suspend judgment and determine nothing. The practical result of the indifference to opinions which results is Pyrrho's "peace of mind" (D.L. 9.65).
The Life of Pyrrho which Diogenes Laertius includes in his Lives of Eminent Philosophers suggests that Pyrrho lived a life in accord with his own emphasis on equanimity and indifference: he lived like a recluse, did not "so much as frown" when treated with disinfectants, surgery and cautery, voluntarily adopted a life of piety and poverty, and performed menial tasks to show his indifference. According to one anecdote, he was criticized when he failed to maintain his composure when a cur rushed at him and terrified him (Pyrrho answered that it is difficult to strip oneself of human nature). The citizens of his native Elis rewarded him with honors, making him a high priest, raising a statue in his honour (Pausanias 6.24.5) and on his account passing a law which exempted philosophers from taxes (D.L. 9.64).
Flintoff locates the origins of Pyrrho's philosophy in India, where Pyrrho travelled with the court of Alexander the Great and was in this way exposed to Indian ascetics and their commitment to an enlightened state of mind. It is clear that Pyrrho was impressed with the indifference of India's gymno-sophists (the "Naked Philosophers"), but it can still be said that his skepticism is more plausibly assigned Greek origins which are found in Democritean atomism. It is in keeping with this that his teacher is the Democritean Anaxarchus (whom he followed to India); his formula ou mallon is borrowed from atomism (DeLacy); his goal of equanimity is closely tied to Democritean practical philosophy; and he is said to have admired Democritus above all others (D.L. 9.67).
Looked at from a Democritean point of view, Pyrrho's skepticism is a natural evolution of Democritus' doubts about ordinary opinions, which he rejected on the grounds that they are contradictory and truth resides in atoms and the void. Pyrrho goes one step further and rejects atomism as well, in the process giving up on philosophy and on all attempts to establish what is true (D.L. 9.69,65; cf. PH 1.28-29; AM 11.1). As Aristocles puts it, "if we are so constituted that we know nothing, then there is no need to continue enquiry into other things.... Pyrrho of Elis was ... a powerful spokesman of such a position" (Eusebius, 14.18.1-2, Long & Sedley).
Sextus describes Pyrrhonism's ties to equanimity (ataraxia) with an anecdote which probably originated in Pyrrho's time with Alexander's court. It relates how Apelles, Alexander's court painter, was frustrated by his inability to paint the froth on a horse's mouth and in exasperation threw a sponge at his painting, accidentally producing the effect he wanted. "So, too, the Skeptics were hoping to achieve ataraxia by resolving the anomaly of phenomena and noumena, and, being unable to do this, they suspended judgment. But then, by chance as it were, when they were suspending judgment the ataraxia followed, as a shadow follows the body." (PH 1.29, Mates)
Apparently, equanimity accompanies skepticism "like a shadow" because it promotes indifference to the misfortunes and calamities that disturb our peace of mind -- misfortunes and calamities which can't, according to the skeptic, be known to be bad. In the context of his actual life, Pyrrho probably maintained his attitude of calm composure by using the method of antithesis which is outlined in the following fragment of Democritus:
[In order to achieve cheerfulness]... one must keep one's mind on what is attainable, and be content with what one has, paying little heed to things envied and admired, and not dwelling on them in one's mind. Rather must you consider the lives of those in distress, reflecting on their intense sufferings, in order that your own possessions and condition may seem great and enviable, and you may, by ceasing to desire more, cease to suffer in your soul... One must... [compare] one's own life with that of those in worse cases, and must consider oneself fortunate, reflecting on their sufferings, on being so much better off than they. If you keep to this way of thinking, you will live more serenely (fr. 191, cf. fr. 3; Kirk, Raven and Schofield).
The exercises here proposed allow one to be content by continually opposing one's misfortunes with comparisions that make one seem well off. The relativity of value judgments -- a natural component of skepticism -- can in this way provide a psychological basis for peace of mind. As the old saw goes, "I was upset about my lack of shoes until I met a man with no feet."
Pyrrho's own use of such tactics is implied by the report that he was fond of Homer's lines: "Ay friend, die thou; why thus thy fate deplore? Patrocles, they better, is no more" -- lines that combat upset with one's own fate with the thought that one is fortunate in comparison with Patrocles. Oppositions of this sort are probably implied when it is said that Pyrrho "talked to himself" when he trained himself to be good (D.L. 9,64, 64, cf. 69). The same method and ideals are reflected in an incident in which his teacher Anaxarchus cures Alexander's despondency after he has killed a friend (Plutarch, Alex., 52), and in Anaxarchus' own fame as "the happy one," which includes the story that he was unflappable even when he sufferred a horrible death at the hands of the tyrant Nicocreon.
Other commentators ask how Pyrrho survived the pitfalls of day to day life -- much less achieved supreme contentment -- if he refused to believe the truth of his sense impressions. Such issues are reflected in the ancient story that he accepted skepticism "in his actual way of life, avoiding nothing and taking no precautions, facing everything as it came, wagons, precipices, dogs, and entrusting nothing whatsoever to his sensations. But he was looked after... by his disciples, who accompanied him" (D.L. 9.62, Long & Sedley).
Though the consistency of skepticism is open to debate, not much is to be made of this account of Pyrrho's actions, which can be grouped with many other unbelievable stories which Diogenes Laertius reports -- that Pythagoras descended into Hades, that Apollo appeared to Plato's father, that Zeno of Elea bit off his tongue and spat it at a tyrant who was persecuting him, and so on. Laertius has a penchant for such stories is happy to stretch himself to include them -- in this case by citing as his unimpressive authority "those around" Antigonus of Carystus (a comment which makes this account of Pyrrho little more than a rumour.
As Hallie says, we can usefully contrast the claim that Pyrrho rejected the senses with Posidonius' account of his actions (D.L. 9.68) when he was caught in a wild storm at sea. Confronted with other passengers wailing and cringing with horror, Pyrrho is said to have remained calm and pointed to a small pig which was eating on the deck, ignoring the storm, saying that its attitude demonstrated the unperturbed state of the wise man. In keeping with Pyrrho's professed philosophy, this suggests that it is human fears and frailties -- not sense impressions -- which Pyrrho tried to expunge by skeptical inquiry.
It can still be asked how Pyrrho could consistently embrace his senses and his skeptical conclusions. His student Timon answers that the Pyrrhonian guides himself by "appearances" (phainomena -- what "appears to be the case"). This suggests that Pyrrho rejected claims to truth and viewed his skepticism and his day to day beliefs as a mere acceptance of appearances that stops short of claims to truth. As Diogenes Laertius puts it:
...the dogmatists say that they [the skeptics] abolish life, in the sense that they throw out everything that goes to make up a life. But the sceptics say that these charges are false. For they do not abolish, say, sight, but only hold that we are ignorant of its explanation.... We do sense that fire burns, but we suspend judgement as to whether it is fire's nature to burn.... "We only object," they say, "to the non-evident things added on to the phenomena [the appearances].... For this reason, Timon in his Pytho says that he has not diverged from what is customary. And in his Likenesses he says, "But the apparent utterly dominates wherever it goes." And in his work On the Senses he says, "That honey is sweet I do not posit; that it appears so I concede." (D.L. 9.104-5, Inwood & Gerson)Such claims suggest that we should interpret early Pyrrhonean claims -- and even Pyrrho's claim that things "are" indifferent, unmeasurable and inarbitrable -- as claims about what appears to be the case. Whether such moves can, in the end, save the skeptic from the charge of inconsistency is a matter of much debate (see, for example, Frede and Burnyeat).
The first of the Academic skeptics is Arcesilaus (316/315-242/241 B.C.), the head of the "Middle" or "Second" Academy. He was influenced by Plato, Pyrrho and Diodorus Cronus (a dialectician of impressive skill) and Ariston describes him as "Plato in front, Pyrrho behind, Diodorus in the middle" (D.L. 4.33). According to Sextus, his skepticism is "virtually identical" with Pyrrhonism (PH 1.232). While Arcesilaus was no ascetic (see, e.g., D.L. 4.37-42), he still held that skepticism aims at happiness (AM 7.158) and some of the anecdotes we find in Plutarch suggest that he, like Pyrrho, believed that we should deal with misfortune and unhappiness by finding different ways of looking at particular situations (see "On the control of anger," 461E and "On Tranquillity of Mind," 470A-B).
Arcesilaus' arguments focus primarily on Stoic epistemology. According to Couissin, he has no views of his own, and offers his arguments merely as a reductio ad absurdum of the Stoic point of view. It is difficult (perhaps impossible) to judge whether this is so in the context of the extant scanty evidence almost 2000 years later, especially as it is never easy to tell how a philosopher intends a particular argument or position (Caton even argues that Descartes is not committed to the cogito in the Meditations). This much being granted, such an interpretation clearly contradicts our ancient sources.
However one interprets it, the crux of Arcesilaus' attack on Stoic epistemology is his attack on the "cataleptic" impression (the kataleptike phantasia). According to the Stoics, it is a clear and distinct impression which reveals certain truth. According to Arcesilaus, there is no such impression and can be no guarantee of truth, for any cataleptic impression can be paired with an equally forceful impression which is mistaken because it is experienced in dreaming, hallucinating, etc. (Ac., 2.77; AM 7.252).
According to Sextus, Arcesilaus combines his skeptical arguments with a commitment to "the reasonable" (the eulogon) which he propounds as a practical criterion in day to day affairs.
...since it was necessary... to inquire into the conduct of life which naturally cannot be directed without a criterion, upon which happiness too, that is, the goal of life depends for its reliability, Arcesilaus says that he who suspends judgment about everything regulates choices and avoidances and, generally, actions by reasonableness, and, proceeding according to this criterion, will act correctly. For happiness arises because of prudence, and prudence resides in correct actions, and a correct action is that which, having been done, has a reasonable defence. Therefore, he who adheres to reasonableness will act correctly and will be happy. (AM 7.158, Inwood & Gerson)Those who, like Couissin, see Arcesilaus as a purely negative dialectician do not believe that he actually endorsed such views, but Sextus straightforwardly claims he does and some such commitment makes good philosophical sense (on this point, see Hankinson, 86-91). Especially in a historical context in which philosophy is expected to provide a practical guide to life.
One might, of course, debate whether Arcesilaus' endorsement of the "reasonable" was consistent with his skepticism. That this was a heated issue already in ancient times is evident in Plutarch's Against Colotes, which takes the Epicurean to task for his attack on Arcesilaus and other philosophers in a book entitled On the fact that the doctrines of the other philosophers make it impossible to read . Lest too much be made of Colotes' attack on Arcesilaus, it should in this regard be said that Colotes' book also attacked Democritus, Aristotle, Parmenides, and Socrates -- indeed, virtually everyone but his mentor, Epicurus. According to an angry Plutarch, the details of Arcesilaus' views get from him the kind of careful attention a performance on the lyre gets from an ass.
One finds an account of some of Carneades' central arguments for skepticism in Sextus' work, "Against the Logicians" (AM 1.159-165). According to Sextus' account, they were addressed against all of Carneades' predecessors. The first maintained that there can be no guide to truth because reason, the senses, and any other guide can play us false. The second argued that the impressions (or "presentations") that inform our judgments are not objective, but reflect their own subjective nature -- as light shows both itself and the things within it. It appears that the subjectivity of impressions which this emphasizes was underscored by an appeal to the by now standard argument that any impression which appears true can be paired with (and opposed by) a similar impression which is false.
Cicero implicitly attributes Carneades the use of antithesis to promote equanimity when he says that he criticized Chrysippus because he approved of a passage in which Euripides recounts the pain of life. According to Carneades, Chrysippus was in this way promoting depression and the passage should instead be used to bring comfort to the ill-disposed by reciting the misfortunes of others (Tus Dis 3.59-60). A similar concern with equanimity is evident in Carneades' claim that we should oppose the expected with the unexpected -- health with the possibility of sickness, safety with the possibility of accident, etc. -- because the unexpected causes us grief when it catches us off guard (Plutarch, Tranq 474F-75A). In a justly famous speech Carneades demonstrated his commitment to opposing arguments as a means of promoting peace of mind by arguing, for the sake of Clitomachus in the wake of the destruction of his native Carthage, that the wise man will not be distressed even at the loss of his native city (Cicero, Tus Dis 3.54).
Despite his arguments for skepticism, Eusebius says that Carneades did not suspend judgement on all matters (Prep. Ev. 14.7.15), but distinguished between things that are "non-evident" (non-apparent) and "non-apprehensible," and held that everything is non-apprehensible but not non-evident. One might try to compare the Pyrrhonean commitment to appearances, but this is difficult given that Carneades (unlike the Pyrrhonians) is said to rank different kinds of impressions, distinguishing those which are more and less persuasive.
In "Against the Logicians," Sextus says that Carneades adopted the pithanon (the "plausible") as a practical criterion and distinguished between impressions which are: (i) implausible; (ii) plausible (i.e. appear true "to an intense degree"); (iii) irreversible (i.e. plausible and confirmed by other impressions); and (iv) tested (i.e. irreversible and tested by the scrutiny of surrounding circumstances). According to this account of Carneades' views, he held that different levels of plausibility are appropriate in different kinds of circumstances. While he proposed plausible impressions as a guide in matters of no importance, he is said to hold that weighty matters call for impressions which are irreversible and tested (AM 7.184).
Sextus illustrates Carneadean plausibility with a famous example:
On seeing a coil of rope in an unlighted room a man jumps over it, conceiving it for the moment to be a snake [i.e. judging this to be plausible], but turning back afterwards he inquires into the truth, and on finding it motionless he is already inclined to think that it is not a snake [for this impression seems reversible], but as he reckons, all the same, that snakes too are motionless at times when numbed by winter's frost, he prods at the coiled mass with a stick, and then, after thus testing the impression received, he assents to the fact that it is false so supposes that the body presented to him is a snake. (AM, 7.187-88, Bury)
Judging by ancient sources, Carneades tried to make the pithanon compatible with his skepticism by emphasizing that plausibility is inherently subjective and not to be understood as a measure of objective probability or truth. Clitomachus thus writes that "The Academic school holds that there are dissimilarities between things of such a nature that some of them seem plausible and others the contrary; but this is not an adequate ground for saying that some things can be perceived [as true] and others cannot, because many false objects are plausible..." (Cicero Ac 2.103, Rackham; cf. 104 and AM 7.169). This makes Academic assent conciously subjective and in view of this more constrained than the assent which is implied by claims to truth.
Though Carneades may in this way have avoided claims to truth, his account of plausible and implausible impressions drives an important wedge between his views and Pyrrho's, for Pyrrho attempts to accept appearances with a minimum inclination that seems incompatible with the conviction that some beliefs are highly plausible. As Sextus puts it, "And although both the [later] Academics and the Skeptics say that they are persuaded of certain things, here too the difference of the philosophies is very evident. For `to be persuaded' has different senses: on the one hand, it means not to resist but simply to follow without much proclivity or strong pro feeling, as the child is said to be obedient to his teacher; but sometimes it means assent to soemthing by choice and with a kind of sympathy due to strong desire, as when a profligate man is persuaded by one who approves of living extravagantly. Since, therefore, the followers of Carneades and Cleitomachus say both that they are strongly persuaded and that things are strongly persuasive, whereas we say that we simply make a concession without any strong feeling, we would differ from them in this respect, too." (PH 1.230, Mates).
This issue is a thorny one, as any philosopher is likely to act as a dialectician at some time or other, and dialectical argument is an integral part of skepticism, which continually propounds particular points of view "for the sake of argument." Sextus is a case in point, for he spends very little time expounding his own philosophy and is instead preoccuppied with a huge catalogue of arguments with conclusions to which he is not, in the final analysis, committed. If we had lost only a few pages of Sextus' extant works, we could easily have been left with a collection of his work which was completely dialectical.
In this context, it is useful to consider Academica 2.78, where Philo and Metrodorus are said to attribute Carneades a skepticism which holds that the wise man cannot perceive anything (as true) but may accept an opinion nonetheless. Cicero goes on to say that he prefers to the view of Clitomachus, who holds that Carnedes "did not so much accept this view as advance it in argument." This clearly suggests that Carneades offered such a view only for dialectical purposes, but it provides very limited evidence for the dialectical interpretation, for it does not show that this is Carneades' only mode of argument (cf. Hankinson, 94).
The most important textual evidence in favour of the dialectical interpretation is found at Academica 2.139, where Cicero says that Clitomachus used to declare that he had never been able to understand what Carneades did accept (see Striker, 55; Hankinson, 94; Inwood & Gerson, 165; Long & Sedley, Vol 1, 455). Even if we interpret this remark in the general way that has been suggested, it is significant that Clitomachus does not say that Carneades is a dialectician, and does not claim that he had no opinions of his own. At the very least, this means that Carneades' closest follower -- who was in a far better position to judge than we are -- is not an adherent of the dialectical interpretation.
More importantly perhaps, Cicero's comment is embedded in a discussion of the good, in which Carneades is said to have defended Calliphon's view that the good is pleasure with such zeal "that he was thought actually to accept it (although Clitomachus used to declare that he had never been able to understand what Carneades did accept)." Taken in its proper context, the parenthetical comment about Clitomachus' view of Carneades is easily interpreted as the claim that Clitomachus did not understand what Carneades held in this regard. So it cannot provide decisive evidence for the claim that Carneades was a dialectician.
Usually, the dialectical interpretation of Carneades is defended on the grounds that it saves Carneades from inconsistency (for if he has no views, he need not render them consistent with his own philosophy). But any advantage gained in this regard is earned by turning Carneades' philosophy into a purely negative philosophy which provides no basis for action. This makes it less of a philosophical accomplishment, especially in a historical context in which philosophy is integrally tied up with the question how one should live one's life (cf. Lactantius, Div. Ins. 5.14.5 and Cicero, On Divination, 2.148).
Carneades may, in any case, have avoided the charge of inconsistency without having to give up on skepticism, so long as he emphasized (as Sextus suggests) the qualified and subjective nature of the assent that he endorsed. So understood, his commitment to persuasiveness and the assent that this implies is, at least on the face of it, compatible with a rejection of claims to objective truth.
The next important ancient skeptic was Aenesidemus, who defected from the Academy and revived Pyrrhonism in the early years of the first century B.C. "The Academics," he says, "especially the ones now, sometimes agree with Stoic opinions and, to tell the truth, appear to be just Stoics in conflict with Stoics" (Photius, Bibl. 212, Inwood & Gerson). In answer to their views, his eight books of Pyrrhonian Arguments propounded the view that "the Pyrrhonist determines nothing, not even this, that he determines nothing" (ibid). It is perhaps ironic that he himself is reported to have given up on Pyrrhonism, and to have finished his career as a Heracleitan, apparently on the grounds that skeptical antithesis should be seen as a road leading to the realization that reality is full of opposites (PH 1.210, cf. AM 7.349, 9.336-67, 10.216, De An 9.5, 14.5).
Though Aenesidemus' books on Pyrrhonism do not survive, they are summarized by Photius, whose account suggests that they systematized Pyrrhonism by establishing standard argumentative strategies and collecting an array of arguments, puzzles and conundrums borrowed from the whole of Greek philosophy.
We know of later Pyrrhonism primarily through three surviving works of Sextus Empiricus (ca. 200 A.D.): The Outlines of Pyrrhonism; a second book which includes "Against the Logicians," "Against the Physicists" (2 books) and "Against the Ethicists;" and a third book called Against the Learned (Pros Mathematikos). The relations between these books are complex and not yet well explored (in Sextus 1997, Bett argues for a reading of Against the Ethicists which would make it propound a very different skepticism than the Outlines of Pyrrhonism). Only the most central features of later Pyrrhonism can be considered here.
Pyrrhonism's most central arguments are the ten modes (or "tropes") which Sextus attributes to "the older skeptics" at PH 1.35-63. They create antitheses and promote epoche by contrasting:
(i) the opposing perceptions and views of the world which characterize different species ("[I]n respect of touch," for example, "how could one maintain that creatures covered with shells, with flesh with prickles, with feathers, with scales are all similarly affected?" and "sweet oil seems very agreeable to men, but intolerable to beetles and bees; and olive oil is beneficial to men, but when poured on wasps and bees it destroys them; and sea water is a disagreeable and poisonous drink for men, but fish drink and enjoy it.");(ii) the opposing perceptions and views of the world which characterize different individuals ("...the greatest demonstration of the great and boundless difference among the intellects of men is," for example, "the disagreement among the utterances of the dogmatists, especially that concerning what it is fitting to choose and to avoid.");
(iii) the opposing perceptions and views of the world which characterize different sense organs ("Pictures seem to the sense of sight to have concavities and convexities," for example, "but not to the touch," and "Let us imagine someone who from birth has ...lacked hearing and sight. He will start out believing in the existence of nothing visible or audible, but only of the three kinds of quality he can register. It is therefore a possibility that we too, having only our five senses, only register from the qualities belonging to the apple those which we are capable of registering. But it may be that there objectively exist other qualities.");
(iv) the opposing perceptions and views of the world which characterize different circumstances ("...things strike us differently depending on whether we are in a natural or unnatural state, since madmen and those possessed by the gods seem to hear the voices of daimons, but we do not... And the same water seems to be boiling when poured onto feverish spots, but is [only] lukewarm to us.... And if someone should say that a conjunction of certain humours causes uncongenial presentations to come from the objects to those who are in an unnatural state, then one should say that since even the healthy have a blend of humours, these are able to make the external objects... appear [other than they are] to those who are healthy...");
(v) the opposing perceptions and views of the world that characterize different positions and distances and places (for example, "lamplight appears dim in sunlight but bright in the dark. The same oar appears bent in water but straight when out of it");
(vi) the opposing perceptions and views of the world that characterize mixtures ("[W]e deduce that since no object strikes us entirely by itself, but along with something, it may perhaps be possible to say what the mixture compounded out of the external object and the thing perceived with it is like, but we would not be able to say what the external object is like by itself... The same sound appears one way when accompanied by a rarefied atmosphere, another way when accompanied by a dense atmosphere");
(vii) the opposing perceptions and views of the world due to different quantities and structures ("Silver filings," for example, "appear black when they are by themselves, but when united to the whole mass they are sensed as white... And wine strengthens us when drunk in moderation but when too much is taken it paralyses the body...");
(viii) the opposing views possible because of the relativity of all things ("...since all things are relative, we will suspend judgment about what things exist absolutely and in nature... This has two senses. One is in relation to the judging subject [different subjects perceiving differently]... The other in relation to the conceptions perceived with it...");
(ix) the opposing perceptions and views of the world due to constancy or rarity of occurrence ("The sun is," for example, "much more astounding than a comet; but since we see the sun constantly and the comet rarely we are so astounded by the comet that we regard it as a divine sign, but are not at all astounded by the sun. If, however, we imagine the sun as appearing rarely and setting rarely, and illuminating everything all at once and suddenly throwing everything into shadows, then we shall see that there is a great deal of astonishment in the thing..."); and
(x) the opposing perceptions and views of what is right and wrong which characterize different ways of life, laws, myths and "dogmatic suppositions" ("...in Persia," for example, "homosexual acts are customary, while in Rome they are forbidden by law; ...among us adultery is forbidden while among the Massagetae it is accepted by custom as indifferent... among us it is forbidden to have sex with your mother, while in Persia it is the custom to favour such marriages; and in Egypt they marry their sisters, which among us is forbidden by law").
Later Pyrrhonean modes more clearly isolate the basic epistemological issues which are raised by the traditional ten modes. The five modes of Agrippa, discussed at PH 1.164-77 (analyzed in detail by Barnes) promote the suspension of judgment by invoking:
-- disagreement, for amongst philosophers and ordinary people there is interminable disagreement;-- regress ad infinitum, for the skeptic asks for a proof of a claim, a proof of the reliability of this proof, and so on ad infinitum;
-- relativity, for things are relative to both one's subjective nature the concepts one employs in judging them;
-- hypothesis, for the skeptic does not allow us to take as our starting point something which is taken for granted;
-- circular reasoning, for the skeptics reject proofs that are circular, as when sense impressions are used to establish the veracity of the senses.
The standard modes are further reduced to a basic set of two in the following chapter of the Outlines of Pyrrhonism, where it is argued that everything which is apprehended (as true) must be apprehended through itself or some other thing. But according to the Pyrrhoneans, the first alternative is undermined by the "controversy among philosophers" and the second by a demand for justification which entails a regress ad infinitum which can be stopped only by claiming that something is apprehended as true in virtue of itself (a possibility undermined by the first mode).
The various sets of Pyrrhonean modes systematize ancient arguments for skepticism but we should not exaggerate the role they played in ancient skepticism. Judging by Sextus, they are usually backed and very frequently supplanted -- by an enormous catalogue of other arguments which were used to argue for epoche on whatever topic happens to be at hand (space, time, the good, the gods, fate, the meaningfulness of standard conceptions of human nature, and so on and so forth). No encyclopedia article can fully convey the spirit of the seemingly endless assortment of claims and counter claims that Sextus is ready to marshal on any topic.
At PH 2.41-44, for example, Sextus condemns the convoluted arguments and conundrums of ancient dialectic:
As regards sophisms the exposure of which is useful, the dialectician will not have a word to say, but will propound such arguments as these -- "If it is not so that you both have fair horns and have horns, you have horns; but it is not so that you have fair horns and have horns, therefore you have horns." "If a thing moves, it moves either in the spot where it is or where it is not; but it neither moves in the spot where it is (for it is at rest) nor in that where it is not (for how could a thing be active in a spot where it does not so much as exist?)" "Either the existent becomes or the non-existent; now the existent does not become (for it exists); nor yet does the non-existent (for the becoming is passive but the non-existent is not passive); therefore nothing becomes." "Snow is frozen water; but water is black; therefore snow is black."And when he has made a collection of such trash he draws his eyebrows together, and expounds Dialectic and endeavours very solemnly to establish for us by syllogistic proofs that a thing becomes, a thing moves, snow is white, and we do not have horns, although it is probably sufficient to confront the trash with the plain facts, smashing up their positive affirmation with equal contradictory evidence derived from the appearances. (PH 2.241-44, Bury, cf. Timon's attitude reported in D.L. 9.111, 2.107)
Appealing to a precedent which was set by early Pyrrhonism, later Pyrrhonism proposes that we replace philosophical attempts to establish what is true with an acceptance of appearances which provides a basis for ordinary actions and skeptical assertions. As Diogenes Laertius writes:
Aenesidemus too in the first book of his Pyrrhonian Arguments says that Pyrrho determines nothing dogmatically because of the existence of contradictory arguments, but rather follows appearances. He says the same thing in Against Wisdom and On Investigation. And Zeuxis, an associate of Aenesidemus, in On Twofold Arguments and Antiochus of Laodicea and Apellas in his Agrippa posit the phenomena alone. Therefore, according to the sceptics, the appearance is a criterion, as Aenesidemus too says. (D.L. 9.106, Inwood & Gerson)According to Sextus, "when we question whether the external object is such as it appears, we grant that it does appear, and we are not raising a question about the appearance but rather about what is said about the appearance; this is different from raising a question about the appearance itself. For example, the honey appears to us to be sweet. This we grant, for we sense the sweetness... And even when we do present arguments in oppostion to the appearances, we do not put these forward with the intention of denying the appearances but by way of pointing out the precipitancy of the Dogmatists... (PH 1.19, Mates).
The later Pyrrhonean commitment to appearances is consolidated in a "Practical Criterion" which was used to establish a "standard of action" which allows the Pyrrhonean to "perform some actions and abstain from others."
Holding to the appearances, then, we live without beliefs but in accord with the ordinary regimen of life, since we cannot be wholly inactive. And this regimen of life seems to be fourfold: one part has to do with the guideance of nature (physis), another with the compulsion of the (pathe), another with the handing down of laws and customs, and a fourth with instruction in arts and crafts (techne). Nature's guidance is that by which we are naturally capable of sensation and thought; compulsion of the pathe is that by which hunger drives us to food and thirst makes us drink; the handing down of customs and laws is that by which we accept that piety in the conduct of life is good and impiety bad; and instruction in arts and crafts is that by which we are not inactive in whichever of these we acquire. (PH 1.23-4, Mates)
Like the early Pyrrhonians, the later Pyrrhonians claimed that skeptical arguments and the Pyrrhonean acceptance of appearances could provide the basis for a happy life characterized by peace of mind. As Diogenes Laertius puts it, "The sceptics say the goal is suspension of judgement, upon which freedom from anxiety follows like a shadow, as Timon and Aenesidemus and their followers put it." (D.L. 9.107, Inwood & Gerson, cf. PH 1.29). According to Sextus, the telos of skepticism is tranquillity of mind (ataraxia) and "moderate" feeling "in respect of things unavoidable." (PH 1.26)
We do not... take Sceptics to be undisturbed in every way -- we say that they are disturbed by things which are forced upon them; for we agree that at times they shiver and are thirsty and have other feelings of this kind. But in these cases ordinary people are afflicted by two sets of circumstances: by the feelings themselves, and no less by believing that these circumstances are bad by nature. Sceptics, who shed the additional opinion that each of these things is bad in its nature, come off more moderately even in these cases. (PH 1.29-30, Annas & Barnes)
Mates has criticized this aspect of Pyrrhonism, writing that "It is hard to find much plausibility in the general claim that the person who, on a given occasion, thinks `this appears to me to be very, very bad' will be any less upset than if he thought `this is very, very bad' (63). One might answer that the Pyrrhonean acceptance of appearances is more constrained than this suggests, for it takes place within the context of equally convincing arguments for and against the view that things are as they appear (the equal force of opposing arguments, isostheneia thus plays a central role in Pyrrhonean thinking). In this way the Pyrrhoneans purposely avoided thoughts like "This appears very, very bad," trying to substitute thoughts like "This appears bad, but I have equally convincing reasons for thinking it may not be so." The qualifications which skepticism thus introduces provided a psychological basis for a detached and distant "following" of appearances which nutured Pyrrhonean equanimity.
Given the practical goals of Pyrrhonism, the psychological force of Pyrrhonean arguments is as important as their logical force, for it constrained the extent of the Pyrrhonian's conviction when he followed his appearances. This highlights an important difference between ancient and modern arguments for skepticism. For though the former were employed as logical devices that establish epistemological conclusions, they were also used as psychological tools which were designed to break down attachment to belief and in this way foster ataraxia. In explaining why there are times when the skeptic's collection of arguments includes those which are weak, Sextus therefore says that the skeptic uses arguments of different strengths "just as doctors have remedies of different strengths for bodily ailments and for those suffering excessively employs the strong ones and for those suffering mildly the mild ones" (PH 3.280, Inwood & Gerson).
How radical is ancient skepticism?
Though Sextus makes much of the skeptic's open-minded attitude to the possibility of apprehending truth, it is clear that the arguments that he and other skeptics used raise questions about any claim to truth.
Some examples can illustrate the far reaching consequences of the skeptic's arguments. According to Sextus, the skeptic will not, for example, assent even if he can find no fault with a position. For "[W]hen someone propounds to us a theory which we are unable to refute, we say to him in reply `Just as, before the birth of the founder of the School to which you belong, the theory it holds was not as yet apparent as a sound theory... so likewise it is possible that the opposite theory to that which you now propound is... not yet apparent to us, so that we ought not as yet yield assent to this theory which at the moment seems to be valid." (PH 1.33-34, Bury)
The extent of the ancient skeptic's concerns is also evident in the modes of skepticism (and especially the later modes), which are universally applicable and can be used to question all of our beliefs. Even the way in which the skeptics appeal to other ancient philosophies allowed them far more radical doubt than we normally engage, for it allowed them to invoke extreme points of view that it contains. An example is Gorgias' argument for the conclusions that nothing exists, that if it did we could not know so, and if we knew so we could not communicate it. In his work, Sextus takes a special interest in this argument (and preserves our most important fragment) precisely because it raises radical doubts about all things. In a similar vein, we find him exploiting for skeptical ends the opinions of obscure thinkers like Xeniades of Corinth -- who, he says, maintained that every impression and opinion is false (AM 7.53, cf. 48: a disconcerting view but no more so than the Protagorean view that every opinion is true).
Mates has underscored the radical nature of the questions that the ancient skeptics raised by pointing out that Sextus will not even grant that we have coherent concepts of the external world, soul, body, sense impressions, etc. As he puts it in discussing the Sextus' attitude to the external world, "His own deep skepticism leaves him in a state of epoche, not only as to whether there are any such things as `external objects,' but even as to whether these terms of the Dogmatists have any intelligible meaning at all." (55)
How relevant is ancient skepticism?
The fact that ancient skepticism raises radical questions about all opinions and beliefs does not prove that it is relevant to modern and contemporary philosophy. A positive answer to the question whether the questions raised by the skeptics remain relevant must instead be founded on a recognition that they raise doubts that are still relevant to mainstream philosophical inquiry.
It can in this regard be said that ancient skepticism contains many arguments which remain of central importance, even though these arguments are frequently obscured by foreign philosophical terminology and ancient ways of speaking. In view of this, many commentators have explored and demonstrated the significance of ancient skepticism in the context of modern philosophy (see, e.g., Popkin, Schmitt, Jardine, Groarke and Solomon). Though the ancient skeptics do not as clearly anticipate modern and contemporary responses to skeptical concerns (skepticism's apparent tie to liberal political concerns, for example), it can be said that they achieved a very clear understanding of the basic epistemological issues raised by the attempt to build a rational basis for belief. The problem of the criterion and the later modes in particular ask pointed questions about our ability to establish a basis for justified belief.
One answer to skepticism which appears unique to contemporary philosophy is the suggestion that it can in some way be linguistically dissolved. Wittgenstein, Putnam and many others thus argue that skeptical claims in some way violate the norms that govern meaningful language and can in view of this be rejected as nonsensical. In ancient times, Aristocles wrote that skepticism is inconsistent with the assumption that the skeptic understands language (Eus., Prep. Ev. 14.18) but there is no close analogue of this linguistic answer to skepticism within ancient thought. How serious an omission this is depends on whether one believes that attempts to undermine skepticism in this way are plausible or successful (for a negative assessment, see Mates, 68-85).
Is ancient skepticism consistent?
The final question which needs to be asked about skepticism is a recurring feature of the skeptical/anti-skeptical debate. Is ancient skepticism consistent? Or is it untenable because it is inconsistent? How does a skeptic's suspension of judgment allow him to come to the conclusion that skepticism is correct? The ancient skeptics typically answered that they accept skepticism in some "undogmatic" way which does not contradict their rejection of claims to truth (see, e.g., Frede) -- by endorsing appearances, the eulogon, the pithanon, the Pyrrhonean practical criterion, and so on.
This is not the place for a detailed discussion of such issues, but it behooves us to remember that the ancient skeptical attack on truth assumes a particular conception of truth. Burnyeat in particular emphasizes that this ancient conception is thoroughly "realist." It suggests that a claim is true if it corresponds to a real objective world that is not subjective, but exists, as we might now put it, from "a god's eye point of view." As Burnyeat himself writes:
In the controversy between the skeptic and the dogmatists over whether any truth exists at all, the issue is whether any proposition of a class of propositions can be accepted as true of a real objective world as distinct from mere appearance. For "true" in these discussions means "true of a real objective world"; the true, if there is such a thing is what conforms with the real, an association traditional to the word alethes since the earliest period of Greek philosophy (cf. M XI 221).Burnyeat's basic point is important to contemporary attempts to understand ancient skepticism, for it makes such skepticism an attack on realist truth which has affinities to modern and contemporary anti-realism. In the context of questions about consistency, it provides a possible answer to the charge that the skeptics were inconsistent. For in attempting to understand the skeptics, we must recognize that belief, at least in contemporary philosophical parlance, need not mean "accepting something as true" in the realist sense. It follows that the ancient skeptic's decision to suspend judgment on claims to (realist) truth in principle leaves room for anti-realist forms of belief and assent which are now commonplace in epistemological discussion. Rather than eschew all belief (i.e. belief in our sense), this suggests that the ancient skeptic rejects a particular kind of belief to which contemporary epistemology offers a variety of alternatives (founded on coherence accounts of truth, etc.). Unlike the contemporary anti-realist, the ancient skeptic retained a realist conception of "truth" and "belief" and therefore expressed his position as the rejection of belief and the adoption of a weaker following of appearances, subjective impressions, and so on. This difference notwithstanding, the move away from realist conceptions of belief is similar in both cases.Now clearly, if truth is restricted to matters pertaining to real existence, as contrasted with appearance, the same will apply [to related skeptical conceptions]... The notions involved, consistency and conflict, undecidability, isostheneia, epoche, ataraxia, since they are defined in terms of truth, will all relate, via truth to real existence rather than appearance. (Burnyeat, "Can the Sceptic Live His Scepticism," p. 121)
The extent to which the analogy between ancient skepticism and contemporary anti-realism can be carried is open to debate, but it is an important comparison, for it suggests both that skepticism is not fatally inconsistent (for it rejects realist truth and endorses an anti-realist conception of belief) and that the positive account of belief that it proposes is, like many of its arguments against claims to truth, relevant to modern and contemporary philosophical concerns.
First published: November 4, 1997
Content last modified: April 18, 1998