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Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Supplement to Common Knowledge
Proof.
() By Lemma 2.12, ( )
is common knowledge at
, so E is common knowledge at by Proposition 2.4.
() We must show that K *N ( E ) implies that ( ) E.
Suppose that there exists ( )
such that E.
Since ( ),
is reachable from ,
so there exists a sequence 0, 1, . . . , m - 1 with associated states 1, 2, . . . , m and information sets i k( k ) such that 0 = , m = , and k i k( k + 1). But at information set i k( m ), agent i k does not know event E. Working backwards on k, we see that event E cannot be common knowledge, that is, agent i 1 cannot rule out the possibility that agent i 2 thinks that . . . that agent i m - 1 thinks that agent i m does not know E.
First published: August 27, 2001
Content last modified: August 27, 2001