Proof of Proposition 2.5: A Supplement to Common Knowledge

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Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Supplement to Common Knowledge

Proof of Proposition 2.5

Proposition 2.5.
omega

K^m_N(A) iff

(1) For all agents i₁, i₂, … , i_m N, K_i₁K_i₂ … K_{i_m}(A)

Hence,

K^*_N(A) iff (1) is the case for each m greater than or equal to

Proof.
Note first that

( 2 )

^{i₁ N}

K_i₁ (

^{i₂ N}

K_i₂ ( . . . (

^{i_{m - 1} N}

K_{i_{m - 1}} (

^{i_m N}

K_{i_m}( A ) ) ) ) )

^{i₁ N}

K_i₁ (

^{i₂ N}

K_i₂ ( . . . (

^{i_{m - 1} N}

K_{i_{m - 1}} (K¹_N ( A ) ) ) ) )

^{i₁ N}

K_i₁ (

^{i₂ N}

K_i₂ . . . (

^{i_{m - 2} N}

K_{i_{m - 2}} ( K²_N ( A ) ) ) )

= . . .

^{i₁ N}

K_i₁( K^{m - 1}_N ( A ) )

K^m_N ( A )

By ( 2 ), K^m_N ( A ) subset K_i₁K_i₂ . . . K_{i_m}( A ) for i₁, i₂, . . ., i_m N so if omega K^m_N ( A ) then condition ( 1 ) is satisfied. Condition ( 1 ) is equivalent to

^{i₁ N} K_i₁ (
^{i₂ N} K_i₂ ( . . . (
^{i_{m - 1} N} K_{i_{m - 1}} (
^{i_m N} K_{i_m} ( A ) ) ) ) )

so by ( 2 ), if ( 1 ) is satisfied then omega K^m_N ( A ). QED

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First published: August 27, 2001
Content last modified: August 27, 2001

Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy Supplement to Common Knowledge

Proof of Proposition 2.5

Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Supplement to Common Knowledge