This is a file in the archives of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.

Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Supplement to Insolubles
Citation Information


A Proof Concerning Bradwardine's Theory

Here is a proof that on Bradwardine's theory, every proposition signifies that it is true. Let ‘P’ name the proposition replacing ’p.’ Then:

1. p     Assume for conditional proof.
2. P signifies that q     Assume for conditional proof.
3. pq     From 2 and the thesis that what propositions signify follows from them.
4. q     From 1, 3, and modus ponens
5. (P signifies that q) → q     From 2-4, by conditional proof.
6. P is true.     From 5 and Bradwardine's definition of truth, since 5 is general with respect to propositions replacing ‘q’.
7. p → P is true     From 1-6, by conditional proof.
8. P signifies that P is true.     From 7 and "Bradwardine's Principle."

Return to note 19

Copyright © 2001
Paul Vincent Spade
spade@indiana.edu

Supplement to Insolubles
Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy