Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Supplement to Actualism

The 5 Axiom is Logically True

Proof: To see that the 5 axiom is true in every interpretation, pick an arbitrary interpretation I. To show that a conditional sentence is trueI, the definition tells us that we must show that it is trueI at the actual world w0. To do this, we assume that the antecedent is trueI at w0 and then show that the consequent is trueI at w0. So assume that the antecedent of the 5 axiom, namely, ◊φ, is trueI at w0. It follows, by the definition of truth, that φ is trueI at some possible world, say w1. Now to show that □◊φ is trueI at w0, we need to show that ◊φ is trueI at all possible worlds. So pick an arbitrary possible world, say w2. Note that ◊φ is trueI at w2, since φ is trueI at w1. But since w2 was chosen arbitrarily, it follows that ◊φ is trueI in all possible worlds. So □◊φ is trueI at the actual world.