Notes to The Philosophy of Computer Science

1. This criticism is clearly linked to Wittgenstein's views on proofs. But we have to be somewhat careful in this comparison. Wittgenstein argued that proofs have to graspable; they have to be taken in. Otherwise, they cannot be used as tools for further mathematical work and, in particular, to set norms for the mathematical work. For him, graspability appears not to be an epistemological issue but one linked to the normative role of proofs in mathematics.