Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
This is a file in the archives of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.

Dispositions

First published Wed Jul 26, 2006

The glass vase on my desk is fragile. It should be handled with care because it it is likely to shatter or crack if it is knocked, dropped, or otherwise treated roughly. The vase has certain dispositions, for example the disposition to shatter when dropped. But what is this disposition? It seems on the one hand to be a perfectly real property, a genuine respect of similarity common to glass vases, china cups, ancient manuscripts, and anything else fragile. Yet on the other hand my vase's disposition seems mysterious, "ethereal" (as Nelson Goodman (1954) put it) in a way that, say, its size and shape properties are not. For my vase's disposition, it seems, has to do only with its possibly shattering in certain conditions, conditions which I hope will never be realized. In general, it seems that nothing about the actual behavior of an object is ever necessary for it to have the dispositions it has. Many objects differ from each other with respect to their dispositions in virtue of their merely possible behavior, and this is a mysterious way for objects to differ.

Much of the recent work on the topic of dispositions has been focused on attempts to dispel this mystery by explaining attributions of dispositions in other, more readily understandable terms. But even with such an explanation in hand, metaphysical questions about dispositions remain. One group of questions concerns the "grounds" or "bases" of dispositions: my glass vase is fragile, it seems, in virtue of its irregular atomic structure, and in that sense the atomic structure of the vase grounds its fragility. What exactly is the relation between dispositions, like fragility, and their grounds or bases, like my vase's atomic structure? And need there always be a ground or basis to a disposition: might there be "bare" dispositions, ones not grounded in anything at all? Another metaphysical question about dispositions is whether they are (all) intrinsic properties, or whether instead they can be acquired and lost without any intrinsic change in their bearers. Finally, there is a question about the role of dispositions in causation: are dispositions causally efficacious properties, or are they instead epiphenomenal?

The topic of dispositions is interesting in its own right. But it derives further interest from the fact that appeals to dispositions have been made in just about every area of philosophical enquiry. There are explicitly dispositional analyses, for example, of mental states, of colors, of value, of properties, and of conditionals; and dispositions have been enlisted, in one form or another, in the service of illuminating phenomena ranging from our understanding of the logical constants to the nature of beauty. Philosophers interested in just about anything should be interested in dispositions.

1. The Dispositional/Categorical Distinction

It seems proper to begin with a question that is surprisingly hard to answer with much satisfaction: What is a disposition? Dispositions are typically contrasted with "categorical" properties. But we might equally well ask: What is a categorical property? There are some clear cases: fragility, solubility, irrascibility are dispositions, while massiveness and triangularity seem to be non-dispositional, or categorical. But why? What is it about the one group of properties, the dispositions, that sets them apart from the others?

The traditional answer to this question, which first finds expression in recent times in Carnap (1936–7), is that ascriptions of dispositions do, while ascriptions of categorical properties do not, entail certain subjunctive conditionals. The fragility of my glass vase, on this view, requires that the vase would shatter or crack if it were dropped or knocked. More generally, the proposal is:

Entailment. F expresses a disposition iff there are an associated manifestation and conditions of manifestation such that, necessarily, an object is F only if the object would produce the manifestation if it were in the conditions of manifestation.

Among the philosophers who have supported Entailment, or something very much like it, are Carnap 1936–7, Ryle 1949, Goodman 1954, Quine 1960, Mackie 1973, Prior 1985, and Armstrong, Martin & Place 1996.

If ascriptions of dispositions do not entail corresponding subjunctive conditionals, then Entailment is of course hopeless as a characterization of dispositions. We will see in the next section that there are good reasons for thinking just that. But let us suppose, for the moment, that ascriptions of dispositions do entail corresponding subjunctive conditionals. Still Entailment might be disputed on the ground that ascriptions of dispositions are not unique in this regard. If ascriptions of categorical properties also entailed corresponding subjunctive conditionals, then Entailment would imply, presumably falsely, that every property is a disposition. In an influential paper, D. H. Mellor (1974) argued that Entailment does imply this.

(It is worth remarking that their belief in Entailment is what led many philosophers in the first part of the twentieth century to view dispositions with suspicion. Given Entailment, dispositions are essentially purely "hypothetical" or "conditional" properties, making implicit but ineliminable reference to entirely counterfactual states of affairs. The best thing to do with them, therefore, would be to purge them from our ontology. Mellor 1974 is a reaction to this tradition, and Mellor's argument that every property satisfies Entailment is part of a larger attempt to restore the metaphysical respectability of dispositions. Most philosophers today, thanks in large part to advances in the understanding of the semantics of subjunctive conditionals, would probably regard Entailment, if correct, as an unremarkable and straightforward categorization of a class of properties, the dispositions; and they would regard Mellor's argument, if successful, as a demonstration either of the fact that every property is a disposition, or of the fact that Entailment is false. In discussing Mellor's argument I will view it in this light, while noting here that Mellor himself may not so view it.)

Mellor's argument is straightforward. Take an allegedly paradigmatic non-dispositional property: triangularity. If any property is categorical, this one is. But, according to Mellor, triangularity satisfies Entailment, and so should count as a dispositional property. For it is necessary that if an object is triangular then, if its corners were (correctly) counted, the result would be three. There are thus associated with triangularity a manifestation (yielding the result three) and conditions of manifestation (having its corners (correctly) counted) such that, necessarily, an object is triangular only if it would produce that manifestation if those conditions were to obtain; and Entailment therefore predicts that "triangular" expresses a disposition. And as for "triangular" so, presumably, for any predicate that might be thought to express a categorical property.

Elizabeth Prior (1982, 1985) has argued that Mellor's reasons for rejecting Entailment as a characterization of dispositions are unpersuasive. Her argument focuses on Mellor's parenthetical "correctly" in his claim that if an object is triangular then, if its corners were (correctly) counted, the result would be three. If, as Mellor indicates in a footnote, we are to understand "correctly" as referring to the method of counting, as opposed to the result of counting, then his claim is false. For there are possible worlds in which quirky laws of nature ensure that counting always gives the wrong result, and so in which if the corners of triangles are counted, even using a correct method of counting, the result is not three but five. If, on the other hand, we are to understand "correctly" as referring to the result of counting, then Mellor's conditional may be true (although Prior goes on to argue that it is ambiguous, and true on only one of its readings). But the truth of Mellor's conditional, on this understanding of "correctly", "involves a kind of circularity" (Prior 1985, p.61) in a way that the subjunctive conditionals associated with dispositional predicates do not.

The debate over whether Mellor's criticism of Entailment is successful continues today. Mellor (1982) responded to Prior's argument by insisting that "correctly" refers to the method, not the result, of counting, and by arguing that his conditional is in fact true on this understanding. Stephen Mumford (1998) has argued that Prior fails to show that Mellor was wrong, but that an amendment to Entailment can secure the dispositional/categorical distinction in a way that does not count all properties as dispositions (see below). Sungho Choi (2005) supports Mumford's amendment; Dan Ryder (see the paper listed in Other Internet Resources) and Troy Cross (2005) criticize it. Alexander Bird (2003) gives a useful and sophisticated discussion of the general lessons that should be drawn from the debate.

Suppose Mellor is correct to claim that Entailment implies that every property is a disposition. How ought we to react? One option would be to embrace the implication, to welcome the suggestion that every property is a disposition. C.B. Martin and, following Martin, John Heil, have argued that, indeed, every property—or at least every intrinsic property—is dispositional. But one shouldn't conclude from this that, on Martin and Heil's view, no property is categorical. Instead, according to Martin and Heil, every property is both dispositional and categorical (or, as they prefer to put it, both dispositional and qualitative). See Martin 1997, Martin & Heil 1999, Heil 2003 and Heil 2005.

A less radical reaction to Mellor's conclusion would be to reject Entailment and to look for an alternative characterization of dispositions. Stephen Mumford (1998) pursues this strategy, arguing that the debate between Mellor and Prior over the status of Entailment overlooks the fact that even if Mellor is correct to claim that the ascription of any property entails a subjunctive conditional, only ascriptions of dispositions entail conditionals as a matter of conceptual necessity. Mumford defends the view that what is special about ascriptions of dispositions, as opposed to ascriptions of categorical properties, is that they are ascriptions of properties that play a certain causal or functional role, a role that is best captured in conditional terms. For example, on Mumford's view it is a conceptual truth that if something is fragile then (roughly) it would shatter or crack if it were dropped or knocked (in ideal conditions). But although Mellor may be right to say that it is a truth that if something is triangular then if its corners were (correctly) counted the result would be three, this is not a conceptual truth according to Mumford.

Mumford's view about the distinction between dispositional and categorical properties can be separated into two components. First is the point that mere entailment is not a strong enough connection between disposition ascriptions and conditionals to do justice to the intuition that dispositions, unlike categorical properties, are "hypothetical" or "conditional" in nature. What is needed is the strong claim that ascriptions of dispositions entail corresponding conditionals as a matter of conceptual necessity. This part of Mumford's view is just a special case of the unsurprising but important fact that, in general, an analysis of a certain class of statements purports to display not just a modal relation between analysandum and analysans, but a conceptual relation between them. Whatever the right analysis of disposition ascriptions turns out to be, ascriptions of dispositions will be unique not in entailing their analysanses but in entailing them as a matter of conceptual necessity.

The second component of Mumford's view is the thesis, endorsed by Entailment, that ascriptions of dispositions entail conditionals as opposed to some other kind of statement. This component of the view is, in effect, a proposal that we accept at least part of a certain form of conditional analysis of disposition ascriptions. There has been a large discussion in the literature of the prospects for conditional analyses of disposition ascriptions, and I turn to that discussion now. In light of the first component of Mumford's view, a reasonable hope is that a resolution of the question how to analyse disposition ascriptions will settle the matter of what distinguishes dispositional from categorical properties.

2. Analyses of Disposition Ascriptions

Analyses of disposition ascriptions often proceed on the implicit assumption that we can (at least in principle) identify, for any disposition ascription, a manifestation and conditions of manifestation for the disposition being ascribed. For those disposition ascriptions that use explicitly dispositional language—as, for example, when I say of my rickety roof that it is disposed to leak when it rains—this assumption seems harmless. But everyday disposition ascriptions are usually not explicitly dispositional in this way. Most apparently dispositional predicates—‘fragile’, ‘soluble’, ‘malleable’ and the like—make no explicit reference to manifestations or conditions of manifestation for the properties they express, and the assumption that we are nonetheless in a position to identify those manifestations and conditions of manifestation is controversial, to say the least. What, for example, are the manifestations of fragility? Something like shattering or cracking, it seems. But what about splintering, or breaking cleanly in two, or, as with a fragile house of cards, collapsing? It seems hard to say. And what are the conditions of manifestation for fragility? That seems even harder to say (see Prior 1985, Chapter 1).

Perhaps, however, for the purposes of giving an analysis of disposition ascriptions the controversial assumption need not be made. Perhaps it is enough to suppose, as Lewis (1997) supposes, that the ascriptions to be analysed are always to be presented in explicitly dispositional form. It will then be a separate question how to transform everyday dispositional predicates into explicitly dispositional phrases (see Choi 2003, 2006). I will proceed in this way, since it has the advantage of allowing us to keep questions about the adequacy of different analyses of disposition ascriptions sharply distinct from questions about how to identify the manifestations or conditions of manifestation of particular dispositions. (Note, however, that proceeding in this way has the disadvantage of severely narrowing the scope of analyses of disposition ascriptions, so much so that the hope expressed above of using an analysis of disposition ascriptions to yield an account of the difference between dispositional and categorical properties might appear to be dashed. But that hope can be rescued if we suppose that the dispositions are those properties that (we know a priori) can be expressed using explictly dispositional language. See Johnston 1992 for a suggestion along these lines.)

2.1 The Simple Conditional Analysis

The simplest analysis of disposition ascriptions in terms of conditionals is usually referred to, appropriately enough, as the Simple Conditional Analysis:

SCA. An object is disposed to M when C iff it would M if it were the case that C.

SCA has been explicitly endorsed by Gilbert Ryle (1949), Nelson Goodman (1954) and W. V. Quine (1960); and it has been implicitly endorsed, or at least alluded to, by countless others. It is now widely (although not quite universally) agreed to be subject to fatal counterexamples.

2.2 Finkishness, Mimicking, Masking and Antidotes

Counterexamples to SCA were first raised by C. B. Martin in 1957, although his versions of them did not appear in print until Martin 1994. Other counterexamples to SCA are to be found in Smith 1977, Johnston 1992 and Bird 1998.

Martin's counterexamples exploit the fact that some dispositions are "finkish" in the sense that the conditions for an object's acquiring or losing a disposition might in some cases be the very same as that disposition's conditions of manifestation. For example, let us suppose that an electrical wire has the dispositional property of being live just in case it is disposed to conduct electricity when touched by a conductor. SCA would then predict that the wire is live iff it would conduct electricity if it were touched by a conductor. Martin points out that there could be a wire which, although dead, is connected to a device which (reliably) senses when the wire is about to be touched by a conductor, and which makes the wire live in every such circumstance. If the wire were touched by a conductor then, thanks to the work of the device, the wire would become live, and so would conduct electricity. The device can also operate on a reverse cycle, attaching to naturally live wires but causing them to become dead if ever they are touched by a conductor. In this case, although the wire is disposed to conduct electricity when touched by a conductor, the fink ensures that the associated conditional is false.

Martin's examples of finkish dispositions are special cases of what R. K. Shope (1978) called "The Conditional Fallacy in Contemporary Philosophy," roughly the fallacy of ignoring the fact that, in a purported conditional analysis, the truth or falsity of the analysandum might in some cases depend on the truth or falsity of the antecedent of the conditional analysans. In Martin's second case, for example, the truth of "the wire is live" depends on the fact that the wire is not touched by a conductor.

There are other counterexamples to SCA that are not of this general form. One kind of case, originally described by A. D. Smith (1977), involves a true conditional "mimicking" a corresponding disposition ascription. Mark Johnston (1992), to whom the term "mimicking" is due, develops a particularly compelling example of this kind. Consider a sturdy gold chalice, and imagine that a watchful angel so dislikes the chalice that he ensures, by angelic means, that if it were dropped then it would shatter. Despite the truth of this conditional, we should surely not say that the chalice is fragile, or that it is disposed to shatter when dropped. For the reason the conditional is true in this case has nothing to do with the dispositional properties of the chalice—it has to do only with the proclivities of the angel.

Another kind of counterexample to SCA, also due to Johnston (1992), involves a true disposition ascription whose associated conditional is false. But unlike in Martin's example, where the conditional is false because the satisfaction of its antecedent would remove the disposition in question, in Johnston's case the conditional is false because the disposition is not removed but "masked", in the sense that its manifestation is prevented from occurring even when its conditions of manifestation obtain. Consider a fragile glass cup, disposed to shatter when dropped, but (presumably because of its fragility) carefully protected by packing material. The packing material doesn't remove the cup's disposition to shatter when dropped—the cup is still so disposed—but it does ensure that if the cup were dropped it would not shatter.

Cases of masking, in Johnston's sense, are structurally similar to Alexander Bird's (1998) cases of "antidotes". Indeed, Bird's antidotes can be thought of as "last minute masks". A certain poison is disposed to kill when ingested. But even if it is ingested there may still be time to administer an antidote, something which prevents death. As with other cases of masking, the antidote doesn't remove the substance's disposition to kill when ingested, it simply blocks that disposition's manifestation. It ensures, that is to say, that the disposition's corresponding conditional is false.

It might be thought that these counterexamples succeed only given an unreasonably strict interpretation of the conditional on the right-hand side of SCA. It might be thought, for example, that we should understand the conditional "if it were dropped it would shatter" on the right-hand side of the analysis of the vase's disposition to shatter when dropped as meaning something like "if it were dropped then, ceteris paribus, it would shatter", or "if it were dropped under normal conditions it would shatter". To the extent to which cases of finks, mimicks, masks and antidotes are abnormal, these qualifications that are allegedly implicit in the conditional would block the counterexamples.

The counterexamples are not so easily dismissed, however. First, notice that there need be nothing abnormal about a finkish or masking situation. (See Fara 2005a.) Extremely fragile and valuable objects, for example, are routinely protected by various kinds of packaging material. And Martin's case of a "reverse-cycle fink", a device which ensures that an otherwise live wire would become dead if it were touched by an electrical conductor, is no philosopher's invention: as George Molnar (1999) points out, such devices are called fuses. Second, the proposal that we understand the conditionals on the right-hand side of instances of SCA as implicitly qualified by a "ceteris paribus" clause risks rendering SCA vacuous as an analysis. For to say that the glass vase would, ceteris paribus, shatter if it were dropped seems to be simply to say that if it were dropped then, unless it didn't shatter, it would shatter. See Martin 1994, Bird 1998, Mumford 1998 and Fara 2005a; although see Mellor 2000 for the view that the risk of vacuity is unproblematic.

These counterexamples—the cases of finkishness, mimicking, masking and antidotes—seem decisively to refute the Simple Conditional Analysis of disposition ascriptions. Some philosophers, however, do not agree that the refutation is decisive. Lars Gundersen (2002) and Sungho Choi (2006) argue for the strong claim that the examples simply fail to falsify SCA. Daniel Bonevac, Josh Dever and David Sosa (forthcoming) argue for the more modest claim that, rather than refuting SCA, the apparent counterexamples might better be taken to show that the conditional employed on the right-hand side of SCA should be understood as something more exotic than the standard subjunctive conditional. They point out that the counterexamples are successful only on the assumption that the conditional in SCA has certain inferential properties, and so if we deny the conditional those inferential properties then the analysis might be saved.

The typical reaction to the counterexamples, however, is to take them to motivate a new analysis of disposition ascriptions. Most new analyses take the form of amendments to SCA: conditional analyses which (it is hoped) are sufficiently complicated to avoid the counterexamples, but which, in employing conditionals on their right-hand sides, still do justice to the intuition that ascriptions of dispositions are intimately linked to conditional claims. It is to these more sophisticated conditional analyses that I now turn.

2.3 Sophisticated Conditional Analyses

Versions of sophisticated conditional analyses of disposition ascriptions have been offered by Elizabeth Prior (1985), David Lewis (1997), Wolfgang Malzkorn (2000) and D. H. Mellor (2000). Additionally, Stephen Mumford (1998) has argued that although no conditional analysis of disposition ascriptions is forthcoming, considerations of conditionals can shed light on ascriptions of dispositions in that those ascriptions a priori entail (but need not be entailed by) certain kinds of conditionals. Here I will focus on Lewis's sophisticated conditional analysis, since it is the one that has received most discussion in the literature.

Lewis points out that if Martin's cases of "finkish" dispositions are to succeed as counterexamples to SCA then we must suppose that the dispositions of an object are intimately related to that object's intrinsic properties. (Lewis twice says that we should assume that "dispositions are an intrinsic matter" (Lewis 1997, p. 147 and p. 155), the first time suggesting that he means that dispositions are themselves intrinsic properties, the second time suggesting only that the causal bases of dispositions are intrinsic. See sections 3 and 4 below for a discussion of causal bases and intrinsicness of dispositions.) For consider again Martin's case of an apparently dead wire attached to a device that would cause the wire to become live if it were touched by a conductor. If the possession of dispositions could be a purely extrinsic matter, then one could insist that the wire, in virtue of being connected to the device, is in fact not dead but live, even though intrinsic duplicates of the wire are dead. This seems an implausible thing to say. Even if there are some cases of intrinsic duplicates not being disposed alike (see section 4), still an object's dispositions surely have something to do with that object's intrinsic nature. It seems, for example, that no wire made out of rubber is live, no matter what kind of (physically possible) environment it might find itself in. To the extent to which this is correct, Martin's finkish cases are genuine counterexamples to SCA.

Lewis's assumption that dispositions are an intrinsic matter motivates an amendment to SCA that builds the assumption in to the analysis of disposition ascriptions, thereby ensuring that Martin's cases no longer have any force. To take the case of fragility as an example, Lewis's thought is that the mere fact that an object would break if it were struck is neither necessary nor sufficient for its being disposed to break when struck, as Martin's cases show. What is needed, in addition, is the fact that the object has some intrinsic property which, together with the object's being struck, would cause the object to break. In general, Lewis's suggestion (in my words, with some simplifications) is:

Sophisticated. An object is disposed to M when C iff it has an intrinsic property B such that, if it were that C, and if the object were to retain B, then the object would M because Cand because it has B.

Martin's dead wire, connected to the device that would cause it to become live, is correctly predicted by this analysis not to be disposed to conduct electricity when touched by a conductor. For although the wire would conduct electricity if touched, this is due to the fink, something extrinsic to the wire, not to any of its intrinsic properties. Similarly, Martin's live wire connected to the "reverse cycle" device is predicted by this analysis to be disposed to conduct electricity when touched by a conductor. For the wire has an intrinsic property—the property of having free electrons, say—such that, if it were touched by a conductor, and if it were to retain that property, then the wire would conduct electricity (because of being touched and having the property.) It's just that Martin's device prevents the wire from retaining the intrinsic property in question. So provided we assume that dispositions depend on an object's intrinsic properties in the way indicated by Sophisticated, Martin's counterexamples to SCA are neatly avoided. (But see Nolan (2005) for the suggestion that Lewis's assumption about intrinsicness is too strong.)

Sophisticated also avoids the problem of "mimicking", in much the same way as it avoids Martin's counterexamples to SCA. It is true that the gold chalice, watched over by the destructive angel, would shatter if it were dropped. But the chalice has no intrinsic property which would contribute to causing the shattering—the angel alone would cause the chalice to shatter. So Sophisticated correctly predicts that the chalice is not disposed to shatter when dropped; that disposition is merely mimicked by the corresponding conditional.

In spite of these successes, however, it seems that the sophistications of Sophisticated do not help with the problems of masking or antidotes (see Bird 1998, Fara 2005a). Recall Johnston's fragile cup, carefully protected with packing material. The cup, it seems, is disposed to shatter when dropped. And the cup does have an intrinsic property which would join with the dropping in causing it to shatter if the packing were absent. But since the packing isn't absent (and wouldn't be absent if the cup were dropped), the right-hand side of Sophisticated, in this instance, is false. Similarly for cases involving antidotes. A certain poison is disposed to kill when ingested, yet irrespective of that poison's intrinsic properties it wouldn't kill if, after the poison was ingested, an antidote was administered in time. So Sophisticated fails.

In his brief discussion of these cases, Lewis (1997) intimates that it is not clear that we should accept that there even are any cases of masking or antidotes. In discussing the example of a poison, Lewis suggests that we have a choice. We might, on the one hand, say that something is a poison iff it is disposed to cause death when ingested without its antidote; or we might say, instead, that something is a poison iff it is disposed to cause death when ingested—where this disposition can be masked by an antidote. Lewis points out that even if we take the second option, surely we would still want to say that poisonous substances have the first, more complicated disposition as well.

It is not clear, however, how this observation bears on the problems of masking and antidotes. As Lewis himself is careful to emphasize, the question of exactly what the word "poison" means has little to do with a general account of disposition ascriptions. (Thus recall our decision, following Lewis, to demand that the disposition ascriptions being analyzed be presented in explicitly dispositional form.) Consider the plain disposition to cause death when ingested, and forget about whether this is a disposition that all and only poisonous substances have. If I were to ingest a substance with this disposition while having previously ingested an antidote, the substance would not cause my death—yet it would have undergone no intrinsic change, and would still have the disposition to cause death when ingested. It would therefore be a case of masking, and a counterexample to Sophisticated.

2.4 Non-Conditional Analyses

What conclusion should we draw from the failure—if it is a failure—of Sophisticated or other sophisticated conditional analyses of disposition ascriptions to accommodate cases of masking or antidotes? One option would be to abandon the project of trying to give an analysis of disposition ascriptions, and adopt instead the more modest aim of giving a non-reductive explanation of them. This approach is endorsed by Bird (1998) and Molnar (1999). An alternative option would be to develop some other, non-conditional analysis of disposition ascriptions. This approach is endorsed by Fara (2005a), and I end this section with a brief description of Fara's analysis.

Cases of masking, like an antidote's masking a poison's disposition to kill when ingested, are cases in which (i) an object has a certain disposition, (ii) that disposition's conditions of manifestation obtains (or might obtain), yet (iii) the manifestation does not (or would not) occur. Cases of masking therefore show that in spite of the intuition that disposition ascriptions are intimately related to conditionals, they are very much unlike conditionals in at least one important respect: disposition ascriptions are not subject to an analog of the rule of implication modus ponens. To the extent to which conditionals are essentially governed by modus ponens, masking cases suggest that conditionals are just not the right sort of expression to use when analysing disposition ascriptions. (Although see Bonevac, Dever & Sosa (forthcoming) for the view, and its application in this context, that conditionals are not essentially governed by modus ponens; and see Morreau (1997) for a particular implementation of this view.)

Fara (2005a) proposes that instead of using conditionals to give an analysis of disposition ascriptions we should instead use what he calls habituals. Habituals, often treated by linguists as kinds of "generic" sentences, are a commonplace device for characterizing how an object typically, usually, or habitually behaves. Some examples are "John walks to school," "Mary smokes when she gets home from work," and "Peter sings when he's in the shower." When we use a habitual, we are expressing some kind of generalization about the behavior of the habitual's subject. "John walks to school," for example, wouldn't be true if most of the time John drove to school. But the generalization is not quite universal. "John walks to school" is true even if, occasionally (perhaps when the weather is particularly bad) John gets to school by some other means. In this sense, we can think of habituals as expressing universal generalizations that tolerate exceptions.

It is this last feature of habituals—the fact that they tolerate exceptions—that make them well placed to serve in an analysis of disposition ascriptions. For what cases of masking effectively show is that disposition ascriptions themselves tolerate exceptions, in the sense that a disposition need not always become manifest when its conditions of manifestation obtain. It is true, for example, that the poison kills when it is ingested—just not when its ingestion is immediately followed by the administering of an antidote.

To ascribe a disposition to an object, on Fara's view, is not merely to express a habitual claim about that object. For habituals can be true "by accident" in a way that disposition ascriptions cannot. It might be true, just as a matter of bad luck, that it rains when I leave the house. But the truth of this habitual need have nothing to do with any dispositions, either of me or of the weather. To account for this fact, Fara follows Lewis's suggestion that dispositions are, at least in part, an intrinsic matter. A poisonous substance doesn't merely happen to kill when ingested; there is something about the substance, some intrinsic property of it, which explains why it kills when ingested. In general, Fara's proposal is:

Habitual. An object is disposed to M when C iff it has an intrinsic property in virtue of which it Ms when C.

To say that an object does so-and-so in virtue of one of its intrinsic properties is, as far as Habitual is concerned, just to say that the object's possession of the property partially explains why the object does so-and-so. This leaves it open whether, as in Lewis's analysis, the having of the intrinsic property must be among the causes of the disposition's manifestation when that manifestation occurs. It also leaves it open whether the intrinsic property must be a categorical property of the object, or whether it might itself be a disposition. Habitual is thus neutral with respect to metaphysical questions about the nature and role of the "bases" or "grounds" of dispositions. It is time now to leave analyses of disposition ascriptions and turn to those metaphysical questions.

3. Dispositions and Categorical Bases

If I knock my glass vase off my desk onto the floor, and it breaks, we can ask why it broke. Among the good answers to this question are, "Because you knocked it off your desk," "Because it was fragile," and "Because it was fragile and you knocked it off your desk." But there is another good answer, one that many would think gets more to the heart of the matter: "Because you knocked it off your desk and it had an irregular atomic structure." In this last case we are explaining the breaking of the vase by appealing, first, to the fact that it was knocked off my desk and, second, to the fact that it had a particular microstructural, presumably categorical property. That is to say, we are explaining the breaking of the vase without explicitly appealing to any of the vase's dispositional properties, in particular without explicitly appealing to its fragility. It seems that all we need mention, when explaining why the vase broke, is the "causal basis" or "ground" for its fragility, together with the fact that conditions of manifestation for fragility obtained.

The causal basis of an object's disposition is something like a microstructural property of the object that is causally responsible, in certain circumstances, for the manifestation of the disposition. But it will be helpful for what follows to have in hand a characterization of "causal basis" that is more perspicuous, more general, and more careful than this.

In their seminal paper on dispositions, Elizabeth Prior, Robert Pargetter and Frank Jackson (1982) offer the following definition (p. 251):

PPJ. By a "causal basis" we mean the property or property-complex of the object that, together with [the disposition's conditions of manifestation] is the causally operative sufficient condition for the manifestation in the case of ‘surefire’ dispositions, and in the case of probabilistic dispositions is causally sufficient for the relevant chance of the manifestation.

I will not here consider cases of probabilistic dispositions; the ‘surefire’ or deterministic cases are difficult enough. Still there are at least two respects in which PPJ needs improvement. First, some philosophers might balk at the suggestion that properties are ever causally operative, insisting that the domain of the causally operative is restricted to the category of events, or perhaps instances of properties. Second—and much more importantly—PPJ wrongly precludes the possibility of a disposition's being masked, provided it has a causal basis (see Molnar 2003). Johnston's fragile cup, for example, presumably has a causal basis (the cup's irregular atomic structure); yet since the cup is protected by packing material this basis is not a sufficient condition for the manifestation, causally operative or otherwise, even when the conditions of manifestation obtain.

So that we have something to work with in what follows, I propose that we accept the following characterization of "causal basis":

Basis. A causal basis of a disposition to M in conditions C is a property P such that whenever an object which possesses P is in conditions C and Ms, the fact that the object possesses P, together with the fact that it is in conditions C, causally explains why the object Med.

I do not suggest that Basis is a perfectly adequate characterization of "causal basis". It might be more or less plausible, for example, depending on what we take "causally explains" to mean. But it improves on PPJ at least in allowing for the possibility that dispositions may be masked. For alternative characterizations of "causal basis" see Mackie 1997, Johnston 1992, McKitrick 2003b and Molnar 2003.

Note that Basis leaves it an open question whether the causal bases of a disposition need be categorical properties, or whether instead a disposition might have a disposition—even perhaps itself—as a causal basis. And it leaves it an open question whether there could be "bare" dispositions, ones with no causal bases at all. These open questions are the topic of the next section.

3.1 The Possibility of Bare Dispositions

David Armstrong was (to my knowledge) the first to give an argument against the possibility of bare dispositions, as opposed to just dismissing that possibility as unscientific or ontologically irresponsible. Armstrong's argument is for the strong conclusion that not only must every disposition have a causal basis, but moreover the causal bases of dispositions must be categorical, or non-dispositional properties.

Armstrong (1968, pp. 86ff.) invites us to imagine some object which has always manifested some disposition D whenever D's conditions of manifestation have obtained. (Armstrong's example concerns the elasticity of a rubber band.) Suppose the object is not now in the conditions of manifestation. Armstrong claims that unless there were a necessary connection between D and one of the object's categorical properties—a connection which would be established only by the thesis that D must have a categorical causal basis—we would have no reason to believe that the object possesses D. We couldn't reason: "The object has always manifested D in the past, so presumably it used to possess D, and the object hasn't changed categorically, so it still possesses D," since this reasoning would be sound only given the necessary connection between dispositions and categorical properties that is being denied. So, absent this connection, we would have no reason to believe that the object has D, and, more generally, no reason to believe that objects don't gain and lose dispositions all the time. But this is absurd.

In response to this argument D. H. Mellor (1974) points out that if it were sound then it would establish something far stronger than even Armstrong believes, namely that it is necessary, not just that every disposition have some categorical causal basis, but that every disposition have the particular categorical causal basis that it in fact has. Even if every disposition must have some categorical causal basis, that fact would not be enough to preclude the possibility that an object might change dispositionally without changing categorically. So if an inference from the categorical properties of a thing to its dispositional properties requires for its justification that we do preclude that possibility, then even Armstrong's view that every disposition must have a categorical causal basis is not enough to secure such an inference's justification.

Why should we think, though, that the justification of an inference from the categorical properties of a thing to its dispositional properties does require that we preclude the possibility that an object might change dispositionally without changing categorically? Consider an analogy. We have no problem, barring the specter of extreme inductive skepticism, with supposing that objects don't change categorically while we're not looking at them. Why then should we anticipate an analogous problem, as Armstrong's argument suggests we should, with supposing that objects don't change dispositionally, whether we're looking at them or not (provided they haven't changed categorically)? As Mellor (1974) observes, Armstrong's problem "is merely the problem of induction" (p. 165). (For other objections to Armstrong's argument see Tooley 1972 and Mackie 1973; see Prior 1985 for extensive discussion.)

Prior, Pargetter and Jackson (1982) provide a different argument for the view that, necessarily, every disposition has a causal basis (a view they label the "Causal Thesis"). Putting the case of probabilistic dispositions to one side, they ask us to consider a fragile glass A that is subject to dropping or knocking in a world in which determinism is true. They argue (pp. 251–2):

[I]t will be either determined that A breaks, or that A does not break. In the latter case clearly A is not fragile. In the former there will be a causally sufficient antecedent condition operative in producing the breaking—that follows from Determinism. Hence if A is fragile and Determinism is true, there must be a causal basis.

The fact that dispositions can be masked shows that Prior, Pargetter and Jackson are too quick to say that in the case where the glass does not break it is clearly not fragile. It is compatible with determinism that a fragile glass is knocked or dropped and fails to break for one reason or another, provided that reason is not of an indeterministic kind. Put that concern aside, however, and consider the case where the glass does in fact break. Indeed, as Prior, Pargetter and Jackson say, in this case there will be a "causally sufficient antecedent condition operative in producing the breaking". But why need that antecedent condition be a causal basis of the glass's fragility? That is (given PPJ, the definition of "causal basis" that Prior, Pargetter and Jackson are using), why need that antecedent condition be a property or property-complex of the glass? It could, for all the argument shows, be a property or property-complex of some other object; or it could be not a property or property-complex at all but instead some long chain of events stretching back into the causal history of the glass. Nothing in Prior, Pargetter and Jackson's argument rules out these possibilities. Determinism of course requires that something be the cause of the glass's breaking; but without further argument we should not conclude from this that that something must be a causal basis of the glass's fragility.

Michael Smith and Daniel Stoljar (1998) defend the impossibility of bare dispositions by arguing that the very idea of a disposition without a causal basis (in their terminology: an "explanatory ground") is incompatible with what they take to be a plausible semantic analysis of disposition ascriptions. Their analysis of disposition ascriptions is just the Simple Conditional Analysis (see SCA above), with the conditional interpreted after the fashion of Lewis 1973, in terms of similarity among possible worlds. (Smith and Stoljar suggest in a footnote that the fact that SCA is an inadequate analysis has no bearing on their arguments.) Their careful argument is too complex to present here, but their strategy is to show that the proponent of the possibility of bare dispositions is committed, given the analysis of disposition ascriptions, to there being relations of "bare similarity" holding between possible worlds: some possible worlds will count as more or less similar to actuality than other possible worlds simply by being more or less similar—there will be nothing more to be said about why these relations of similarity hold among these worlds. Smith and Stoljar take this consequence of the possibility of bare dispositions—if it is a consequence—to be unacceptable.

Jennifer McKitrick (2003b) argues in response, first, that Smith and Stoljar do not succeed in showing that the commitment to bare similarity follows from the possibility of bare dispositions, and, second, that even if it did then this would not be nearly as problematic as Smith and Stoljar take it to be. If one has already accepted that there might be bare dispositions—"that a thing can have a modal property irrespective of its other properties" (p. 366)—then, McKitrick suggests, one should not be uncomfortable with the idea that there could be "barely similar" possible worlds, worlds whose similarity is not grounded in anything but dispositional or other modal properties.

Simon Blackburn (1990) offers an argument that is in many ways similar to the argument of Smith and Stoljar, although Blackburn's target is not the possibility of bare dispositions but rather the view that the only causal bases of dispositions are themselves dispositional properties: there are dispositions "all the way down". Blackburn argues that such a possibility is incoherent, at least given a possible worlds semantics for disposition ascriptions. Richard Holton (1999) replies by giving a possible worlds model of such a possibility, concluding that however strange it might be the idea is not an incoherent one.

Arguments for the impossibility of bare dispositions are inconclusive. By itself, however, this would be poor reason to believe in their possibility. Moreover, since we are taking a causal basis of a disposition to be any property of an object whose possession causally explains why the object manifests the disposition when it does, there is nothing to prevent dispositions from being their own causal bases (provided dispositions are causally efficacious properties—see section 5 below). Given this point, the possibility of bare dispositions seems a rather innocuous one, one whose denial is tantamount to the claim that dispositions are causally inefficacious. A more interesting question concerns the relation between dispositions and their causal bases. (It is perhaps partly for this reason that McKitrick (2003b) takes a bare disposition to be one that has no distinct causal basis; I have here followed the terminology of, for example, Johnston (1992) and Smith & Stoljar (1998).) Granted that dispositions must have causal bases, what relation do dispositions stand in to them?

3.2 The Relation between Dispositions and their Bases

The different views about the relation between dispositions and their causal bases that have been defended in the literature mirror views about the relation between mental properties and physical properties. David Armstrong defends a "type-identity theory" according to which any disposition is identical with its causal basis. Stephen Mumford defends a "token-identity theory" according to which any instance of a disposition is identical with an instance of one of its potential causal bases. Elizabeth Prior (together with Robert Pargetter and Frank Jackson) defends a "functionalist theory" according to which a disposition is a second-order property of having some causal basis or other. And there is a "dualist theory" according to which the relation between dispositions and their causal bases is one of distinctness and irreducibility. Proponents of dualism are hard to find these days, although the view has been argued for by, for example, James Franklin (1988). There are other views too, for example those of Place and Martin given in (Armstrong, Martin & Place 1996), but I will confine discussion here to the four mentioned above.

We can discern in the work of Armstrong at least four arguments for the view that dispositions are identical with their causal bases (which he conceives of as categorical properties). There is an argument from ordinary usage (Armstrong 1968, p.86): We often say things like, "It has been found that brittleness is a certain sort of molecular pattern in the material," and the best explanation of why we say such things is that they are true. There is an argument from economy (Armstrong, Martin & Place 1996, Chapter 1): If dispositions are identical with categorical bases then our ontology need only contain one kind of property, the categorical. There is an argument from anti-mystery: To posit irreducible dispositions would be to "put something like intentionality into the ultimate structure of the universe" (Armstrong, Martin & Place 1996, p. 16). Finally, there is a direct argument for the identity of dispositions with their causal bases (Armstrong, Martin & Place 1996, Chapter 3): It is true by definition that, for example, brittleness is the property that plays the causal role of brittleness; as a matter of fact, some particular microstructural property plays that causal role; so, as a matter of fact, brittleness is that microstructural property. In general, since dispositions are by definition properties that play certain causal roles, and since in fact their categorical properties are what play those roles, it follows, according to Armstrong, that dispositions are in fact identical with their causal bases.

Armstrong claims that his identification of dispositions with their causal bases is a "contingent identification" (Armstrong, Martin & Place 1996, p. 39), and this is apparent from his fourth argument. As a matter of fact the property that plays the brittleness role is such-and-such, but it might have been a different property that played that role; if so, according to Armstrong, brittleness would have been identical with that different property. This feature of Armstrong's view, that dispositions are contingently identical with their causal bases, exposes that view to Prior, Pargetter and Jackson's (1982) argument from rigid designation. Following Kripke, Prior, Pargetter and Jackson take names of properties to be "rigid designators", referring to the same property in every possible world (in which that property exists). As Kripke (1972) demonstrates, if ‘a’ and ‘b’ are rigid designators then the identity statement ‘a = b’ is necessarily true if it is true at all. So on the assumption that, for example, ‘brittleness’ and ‘microstructural property so-and-so’ are rigid designators, the possibility that the causal basis of brittleness might have been something other than microstructural property so-and-so—a possibility Armstrong concedes, leading him to contingently identify brittleness with its causal basis—shows that brittleness is not identical with microstructural property so-and-so. (See McKitrick 2003b for a reply to this argument on behalf of the possibility that a disposition is its own causal basis (and so, of course, is identical with its causal basis). For additional arguments against Armstrong's view see Prior, Pargetter & Jackson 1982 and Prior 1985; for discussion see Mumford 1998 (Chapter 5) and McKitrick 2003b.)

Stephen Mumford (1998, Chapter 7) seems to endorse this argument when it is construed as an argument against the "type-type" identification of dispositions with their bases that Armstrong defends. But Mumford maintains that the argument does not defeat his own "token-token" identification. According to Mumford, although in general dispositions are not identical with categorical properties, each instance of a disposition is identical with an instance of a categorical property, namely its causal basis. For example, on Mumford's view brittleness is not identical with microstrutcural property so-and-so; but my glass vase's particular brittleness is identical with its particular microstructural property so-and-so. Thus Mumford is "relying upon a notion of property instances or states such that instances of particular dispositions and instances of categorical properties can be identified in what amounts to a token-token identity theory" (Mumford 1998, p. 159).

Anticipating such a view, Elizabeth Prior (1985) complains that it is not at all clear what can be meant by "property instance" if, as Mumford maintains, an object's instance of property A can be the very same thing as its instance of property B, even though property A is not the same as property B. Even if we grant the intelligibility of such a notion of property instance, however, might not the very same argument from rigid designation show that instances of dispositions cannot be identical with instances of categorical bases, any more than dispositions themselves can be identical with categorical bases? Such would seem to be the appropriate lesson to draw from the fact that Kripke's original version of the argument, aimed against identity theories in philosophy of mind, applies as much to token-token as to type-type versions of the identity theory. Mumford disagrees (pp. 157ff.), although he says little to substantiate his disagreement.

Prior's own view about the relation between dispositions and their causal bases is analogous to a functionalist view about the relation between mental and physical properties. According to Prior, a disposition is a second-order property, the property of having some first-order property or other (a categorical causal basis) that plays the causal role of the disposition in question. (See Prior 1985, Chapter 7). It seems to be a consequence of this view that dispositions do not play their own causal roles. (Indeed, Prior argues that dispositions are "causally impotent"; see section 5 below.) For if having, say, the property fragility is a matter of having a first-order property that plays the causal role of fragility, then it would seem that it is this first-order property, not the second-order property, that plays this role. It would seem, then, that the functionalist view about the relation between dispositions and their causal bases is open to an objection commonly levelled against functionalist views in the philosophy of mind: dispositions are predicted by the functionalist to be "causally superfluous" in a way that, intuitively, they are not. (See Mumford 1998, Chapter 5, for this objection, and see section 5 below for further discussion.)

What alternatives are there to identity or functionalist theories about the relation between dispositions and their causal bases? Perhaps the only remaining option is dualism, according to which dispositional and categorical properties are of two fundamentally different kinds, neither of which is explainable in terms of or reducible to the other. (Mumford (1998) seems to take dualism to be the only remaining option, although it should be noted that Prior's functionalism counts as a form of dualism in Mumford's sense.) There is something unsatisfying about dualism (although that of course is not an argument against it). The causal bases of dispositions do, after all, have some connection to the dispositions they are bases of, a connection seemingly stronger than one of mere correlation. Although different fragile objects, for example, have different causal bases—some are fragile in virtue of their irregular atomic structure, some are fragile in virtue of their weak intermolecular bonding, some are fragile in virtue of the instability of larger constituent parts (as with a house of cards)—still it would be remarkable if there were not some principled or systematic connection that held between fragility and these different causal bases.

Perhaps, as an alternative to dualism, dispositions are identical with the disjunction of their (possible) causal bases. (See Cohen 2002 for a defense of this view, in part against criticisms given in Prior 1985.) Alternatively, perhaps dispositions, or instances of dispositions, are constituted by their bases in something like the way in which a statue is constitued by the material from which it is made. Or perhaps dispositions stand to their causal bases in a relation of "realization", a relation which might be given an independently motivated explanation. (See Shoemaker 2001 for an analogous view about the relation between mental and physical properties.) There is much opportunity here for future research.

4. The Intrinsicness of Dispositions

It has long been supposed that dispositions are intrinsic properties of their bearers. We already remarked, in section 2 above, that Lewis (1997) assumed that dispositions are an "intrinsic matter", which at one point he expresses as the view that "if two things (actual or merely possible) are exact intrinsic duplicates (and if they are subject to the same laws of nature) then they are disposed alike" (p. 147). George Molnar has claimed that the intrinsicness of dispositions "is one of the crucial appearances which has to be saved by an analysis" (Molnar 1999, p. 3), although in later work he retreats to the view that the intrinsicness of dispositions is a highly plausible empirical hypothesis. (See Molnar 2003, Chapter 6; see Fara 2005b for discussion.) The view that all dispositions are intrinsic is routinely accepted by most philosophers working on the topic. In addition to Lewis and Molnar, the view is assumed by Bird (1998), Harré (1970), Mackie (1977) and Mellor (1974); the only philosopher to have argued for the view is David Armstrong (1973).

Lewis's qualification about the laws of nature is important, at least for those who take the laws to be contingent, for without it the view that dispositions are intrinsic properties is scarcely plausible. For if the laws are contingent then my fragile glass vase has intrinsic duplicates—possible objects sharing all and only my vase's intrinsic properties—that are not disposed to break when dropped. Some of these duplicates will inhabit possible worlds whose laws of nature determine that objects with an irregular atomic structure gently bounce when dropped onto a hard surface; others will inhabit worlds whose laws determine that any object, when dropped, will hover safely a few inches above the ground. These possible objects will be intrinsically just like my glass vase but will lack the disposition to break when dropped. The widely accepted thesis that all dispositions are intrinsic, therefore, should be understood as the thesis that the dispositions of an object nomically supervene on its intrinsic properties, in the sense that within any sphere of worlds with the same laws of nature, any pair of objects with the same intrinsic properties will have the same dispositions. See Langton & Lewis 1998 for discussion of this point.

Widely accepted as it is, however, the thesis that dispositions are intrinsic—even with Lewis's qualification about the laws of nature—is not obviously true. An early apparent counterexample, although not explicitly presented as such, was given by Sydney Shoemaker (1980), who adapts a case of Robert Boyle's. Shoemaker asks us to consider a key on his key chain, which has the disposition—or "power", as Shoemaker calls it—to open his front door. Shoemaker points out that the key could lose this disposition without undergoing any intrinsic change; it could lose it, for example, by the lock on Shoemaker's door being replaced by one of a different kind. It would seem, then, that the disposition to open Shoemaker's front door is not an intrinsic property of Shoemaker's key, and so the thesis that all dispositions are intrinsic is false.

This apparent counterexample can be resisted, however. It might be maintained that there is no such thing as the disposition to open Shoemaker's front door. The only relevant disposition possessed by Shoemaker's key, it might be insisted, is the disposition to open locks of a certain type—the type of lock that is currently on Shoemaker's front door. Since a change in the lock will not cause the key to lose this disposition, it is an intrinsic disposition (or at least the present example does not show that it is not intrinsic). According to this response, the predicate "disposed to open Shoemaker's front door" either fails to express a genuine property at all (this is Shoemaker's view), or else it somehow manages to express the intrinsic disposition to open locks of a certain type (this is the view suggested in Molnar 2003). Either way, according to this response, the only genuine dispositions are intrinsic properties of their bearers.

Jennifer McKitrick (2003a) argues that this is an idle response to Shoemaker's counterexample. Whatever other properties it may have, Shoemaker's key does seem to have the property of being disposed to open Shoemaker's front door. And, aside from its extrinsicness, this property seems as dispositional as any other property expressed using a phrase of the form "disposed to...": it possesses all of the "marks of dispositionality" (McKitrick 2003a, p. 156). So why say that it is not a "genuine" disposition? One thought might be that it is somehow secondary to, or less important than, or derived from the intrinsic disposition to open locks of a certain kind. But McKitrick points out, first, that this is irrelevant—even a secondary, unimportant, derived extrinsic disposition will serve as a counterexample to the thesis that all dispositions are intrinsic—and, second, that the specific disposition to open Shoemaker's front door is in some ways more important than the general disposition to open locks of a certain kind. What matters to Shoemaker is that his key opens his front door, not that it opens locks of a certain kind, a kind that his front door lock happens to be among. This second disposition, the intrinsic disposition to open locks of a certain kind, is "merely instrumental" to the end of opening Shoemaker's front door (p. 168), and in that sense is of secondary importance.

It might be replied that although allegedly extrinsic dispositions have almost all the marks of dispositionality, they are (trivially) missing the mark of intrinsicness, and it is for that very reason that they are not to be counted as genuine dispositions. George Molnar (2003) explicitly lists intrinsicness as one of the marks of dispositionality, and presumably the philosophers who have simply assumed that all dispositions are intrinsic would be amenable to the suggestion that it is constitutive of dispositions that they be intrinsic. Nevertheless, if Shoemaker's kind of case is not peculiar—that is, if it turns out to be easy to produce multiple examples of extrinsic properties which, aside from their extrinsicness, seem as dispositional as any property can be—then the view that dispositions must by their nature be intrinsic properties seems hard to defend. And McKitrick argues that there are indeed many cases of extrinsic dispositions, listing as examples weight (a case borrowed from Yablo 1999), the disposition to dissolve the contents of my pocket, vulnerability, visibility and recognizability. To the extent to which McKitrick's list can be readily extended, an insistence that dispositions must be intrinsic properties starts to seem like simple prejudice.

5. The Causal Efficacy of Dispositions

Molière famously quipped, in Le Malade Imaginaire, that a philosopher might explain why opium puts people to sleep by mentioning the fact that it has a "dormitive virtue". The point, of course, is that this is no explanation at all. To have a dormitive virtue, it seems, is just to have a property that puts people to sleep, and that fact tells us nothing about why substances with that property put people to sleep. The general lesson to be drawn from Molière's quip might be that the possession of a disposition can play no causal or explanatory role with respect to the occurrence of that disposition's manifestation, since the possession of a disposition conceptually necessitates the occurrence of the manifestation (in the right circumstances), and conceptual necessitation is not a kind of causal or explanatory connection.

J. L. Mackie (1973, 1977) appeals to something like this line of reasoning in arguing for the identity of dispositions with their categorical bases. (A similar argument is endorsed by David Armstrong (1968) and by Frank Jackson (1996).) Mackie purports to show that if dispositions were not identical with their categorical bases then they would be causally inert. Since, according to Mackie, dispositions are by their nature causal properties, it follows that dispositions are identical with their bases. But for those who are persuaded that dispositions are not identical with their bases, Mackie's argument, if sound, would show that dispositions are causally inert.

According to Mackie, it is a semantic fact that when we ascribe a disposition to an object our ascription is true only if the object would produce the disposition's manifestation if the conditions of manifestation were to obtain. But this is not to say, on Mackie's view, that the dispositional property being ascribed is essentially a power to produce a certain manifestation in certain conditions. Instead, according to Mackie, to ascribe a disposition to an object is to ascribe some (perhaps unknown) categorical property which would cause the manifestation if the conditions of manifestation were to obtain. It is in this sense that Mackie thinks (with Armstrong) that dispositions are identical with their categorical bases. If this were not so, Mackie argues, then the possession of a disposition, together with the obtaining of that disposition's conditions of manifestation, would logically necessitate the manifestation. But if one thing logically necessitates another, then, as Hume taught us, there cannot be a causal connection between the two. So if dispositions are not identical with categorical bases, then they are causally inert.

In responding to Mackie's argument, D. H. Mellor (1974) points out that the most Mackie can have shown is that if dispositions are not identical with their bases then the possession of a disposition cannot be a cause of the conditional fact that the manifestation would occur if the conditions of manifestation were to obtain. But this is not to say that dispositions are causally inert. Whether or not dispositions are identical with their bases, it is implausible to suppose, for example, that a certain cup's fragility is a cause of the conditional fact that it would shatter if dropped—such a fact, as Mellor observes, is not an event and so needs no cause at all. Rather, when the cup is dropped, the cup's fragility is a (partial) cause of its shattering; or, as Mellor would have it, the fragility of the cup explains why the shattering is caused by the dropping. Nothing in Mackie's argument rules out these possibilities.

Reflection on everyday talk about dispositions strongly supports the contention that dispositions do play a causal, or at least causally explanatory, role with respect to their manifestions. Why did the glass break? Because it was fragile. Why did Dolores die? Because she ingested a poison. And even: Why do people who take opium fall sleep? Because opium contains a soporiphic, morphine. (See Mumford 1998, Chapter 6.) Yet Prior, Pargetter and Jackson (1982) have argued that simple examples like these do not constitute evidence for the causal efficacy of dispositions, and that, in fact, dispositions are not causes of, or causally explanatory of, their manifestations.

Prior, Pargetter and Jackson argue that the causal inefficacy of dispositions is a consequence of two theses about the relation between dispositions and categorical properties that they endorse: the "Causal Thesis" that every disposition must have a causal base, and the "Distinctness Thesis" that dispositions are distinct from their causal bases. (See section 3 above.) Their argument is brief enough to be quoted in full, and will be familiar to those versed in the literature on "exclusion arguments" in the topic of mental causation:

By the Causal Thesis, any disposition (and thus fragility) must have a causal basis. This causal basis is a sufficient causal explanation of the breaking as far as the properties of the object are concerned. But then there is nothing left for any other properties of the object to do. By the Distinctness Thesis the disposition is one of these other properties, ergo the disposition does nothing. (Prior, Pargetter & Jackson 1982, p. 255.)

Prior, Pargetter and Jackson point out that their argument assumes that dispositions cannot be overdetermining causes of their manifestations. In defense of this assumption they claim that although a single event may be overdetermined in the sense of there being two sufficient antecedent conditions for its occurrence (as when, say, I cause a window to break by throwing a stone at it even though it would have been caused to break by your soccer-ball had my stone not got there first), there are no cases of a single event having two "operative" sufficient conditions. Since, by hypothesis, it is the causal basis of the disposition that is the operative sufficient condition for its manifestation, the disposition itself, even though its possession is sufficient in the circumstances for the manifestation, is an inoperative sufficient condition, and so is not a cause.

It is not clear, however, that it is plausible to claim that a single event cannot have two "operative" sufficient conditions, if by this Prior, Pargetter and Jackson mean that a single event cannot have two overdetermining causes (as opposed the event's occurrence merely having two independent sufficient conditions). Jonathan Schaffer (2003) argues that such cases of overdetermining causes are routine. If Schaffer is right, then Prior, Pargetter and Jackson's argument for the causal inefficacy of dispositions is defused.

Even if Prior, Pargetter and Jackson are correct to rule out the possibility of a disposition's being an overdetermining cause of its manifestation, however, and hence are correct to conclude from their argument (given its premises) that dispositions do not cause their manifestations, there is still the possibility that dispositions are properly cited in causal explanations of the occurrence of their manifestations. Perhaps the fragility of the glass is not part of the cause of its breaking. Still the fragility might be causally efficacious by being causally relevant to the breaking, just as my height is causally relevant to, but does not itself cause, my stooping in low-ceilinged rooms. Prior, Pargetter and Jackson's argument is insufficiently attentive to these distinctions to be used to conclude that dispositions are causally inefficacious in the sense of not even being causally relevant to their manifestations.

Perhaps a more careful version of Prior, Pargetter and Jackson's argument could be devised to generate this strong conclusion. Such an argument, to be successful, would have to be accompanied by a compelling account of what causal relevance is, and the large literature on causal relevance attests to the difficulty of complying with this demand. Jennifer McKitrick (2005) surveys several of the existing accounts of causal relevance, and argues that the most plausible of these give us no clear reason for thinking that dispositions are causally irrelevant to their manifestations, even when combined with an argument like Prior, Pargetter and Jackson's.

If every disposition must have a causal base, and if every disposition is distinct from its base, and if distinct causes cannot overdetermine their effects, then perhaps an independently plausible account of causal relevance would predict that dispositions are causally inefficacious with respect to their manifestations. Absent compelling reasons for accepting all of these provisos, however, there seems to be no good reason for denying dispositions a role in the causal nexus.

Bibliography

Other Internet Resources

Related Entries

conditionals | intrinsic vs. extrinsic properties | laws of nature | mental causation | properties