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Folk Psychology as Mental Simulation

First published Mon Dec 8, 1997; substantive revision Fri Aug 27, 2004

The simulation (or, "mental simulation") theory (ST) is a theory of everyday human psychological competence: that is, of the skills and resources people routinely call on in the anticipation, explanation, and social coordination of behavior. ST holds that we represent the mental activities and processes of others by mentally simulating them, or generating similar activities and processes in ourselves: thus, for example, anticipating another's solution to a theoretical or practical problem by solving the problem ourselves (with adjustments for evident disparities, e.g., in skill level). The basic idea is that if the resources our own brain uses to guide our own behavior can be modified to work as representations of other people, then we have no need to store general information about what makes people tick: We just do the ticking for them. Simulation is thus said to be process-driven rather than theory-driven (Goldman 1989).

What initially sparked philosophical interest in ST was that it seemed to challenge the assumption that a theory (a "folk" psychology) underlies psychological competence. Without this assumption, what had been a major issue in the philosophy of mind would be baseless: namely, the debate between psychological realists, who thought folk psychology a fundamentally sound foundation for cognitive science, and eliminativists, who deemed it a fundamentally flawed theory.

Unlike earlier controversies concerning the role of empathetic understanding and historical reenactment in the human sciences, the current debate between the simulation theory and the "theory" theory appeals to empirical findings, including experimental results concerning children's development of psychological competence and recent discoveries in cognitive neuroscience (see Section 4).

1. What is Meant by "Simulation"?
2. Varieties of Simulation Theory
3. The Parsimony Argument
4. Areas of Empirical Investigation
Bibliography
Other Internet Resources
Related Entries

1. What is Meant by "Simulation"?

In recent discussions of everyday "folk" psychology, the term "simulation" has, like the term "theory," come to be used broadly and in a variety of ways. Simulation is usually equated with role-taking, or imaginatively "putting oneself in the other's place." This metaphor is understood to embrace adoption of different spatial and temporal perspectives as well as other shifts in indexically specified situations (e.g., in social role, office, or kinship relations); and further, adoption of alternative character traits and similar exercises of dramatic impersonation. However, one may also conceive simulation as including simple "projection," without adjustments in imagination; e.g., where there is no need to put oneself in the other's place, as one is, in all relevant respects, already there: e.g., the tornado is approaching not just you or me but us.

Along with this person-level characterization of simulation, simulation is also conceived by most proponents in cognitive-scientific terms. It is assumed that in role-taking, one's own behavior control system is employed as a manipulable model of other such systems. (This is not to say that the "person" who is simulating is the model; rather, only that one's brain can be manipulated to model other persons.) The system is first taken off-line, so that the output is not actual behavior but only predictions or anticipations of behavior, and inputs and system parameters are accordingly not limited to those that would regulate one's own behavior. Although this sometimes results in vicarious decision-making, more typically it stops at the more modest goal of establishing which options would be attractive (so that one would not be surprised to find the other pursuing one of them) and which unattractive (so that one would be surprised to find the other pursuing any of them).

In cognitive neuroscience, the term "simulation" is used to denote the (usually automatic and unconscious) activation, in response to the observed behavior of another, of neural mechanisms associated with the production of like behavior in oneself. (See Section 4.)

Stephen Stich and Shaun Nichols, whose critical papers have clarified the issues and helped refine ST, urge that the term "simulation" be dropped in favor of a finer-grained terminology. However, important as precision is in formulating testable hypotheses, there may also be value in a broad, open-ended inquiry that asks how implementations of the top-down imaginative procedures that philosophers and psychologists describe might mesh with the bottom-up mechanisms that neuroscientists have recently discovered (Gallese 2001; Hurley 2004).

2. Varieties of Simulation Theory

Alvin Goldman and the psychologist Paul Harris conceive simulation differently from Robert Gordon and Jane Heal, the philosophers who, working independently, introduced the theory (Gordon 1986, Heal 1986). (Heal's term "replication" and Gordon's "simulation" were generally taken to refer to the same putative process.) According to Goldman (1989) and, less clearly, Harris (1989), to ascribe mental states to others by simulation, one must already be able to ascribe mental states to oneself on the basis of introspection, and thus must already possess the relevant mental state concepts. The introspectionist account would suggest that simulation can only be justified by an argument from analogy. According to a classic version of this argument,

I am conscious in myself of [a] uniform sequence, of which the beginning is modifications of my body, the middle is feelings, the end is outward demeanour. In the case of other human beings I have the evidence of my senses for the first and last links of the series, but not for the intermediate link…by supposing the link to be of the same nature…I bring other human beings…under the same generalizations…. (J.S. Mill, An Examination of Sir William Hamilton's Philosophy. 6th edition. London, 1869)

According to Gordon's "radical" version of ST (1995), a capacity for simulation is necessary for the very capacity to perceive objects as mind-endowed (and thus for perceiving human beings as persons). Only those who can simulate can understand an ascription of, e.g., belief--that to S it is the case that p. Even though general psychological information may sometimes be called on in our everyday "mind-reading," it is information that would not be fully intelligible to beings that were incapable of simulation — perhaps in the way that information about color would not be fully intelligible to someone incapable of color sensation or imagery. My representation of a particular other (O) is essentially a stored simulation (stored, perhaps, as a set of modifications of myself). Although the particulars of my simulative representation of O are subject to empirical justification, there is no further inference (e.g., based on analogy) from my simulative representation of O to "what O is really like."

While no simulation theorist claims that all our everyday explanations and predictions of the actions of other people are based on role-taking, Heal in particular has been a moderating influence, arguing for a hybrid simulation-and-theory account that reserves simulation primarily for items with rationally linked content, such as beliefs, desires, and actions.

3. The Parsimony Argument

The most important distinguishing feature of folk psychology, according to many theory theorists, is the central and essential role it gives to the semantic content of the states it posits, particularly the propositional or sentential "objects" of propositional attitudes such as beliefs, desires, and intentions. Most theory theorists try to accommodate this feature with the hypothesis that folk psychology comprises laws or principles that quantify over this content, connecting, for example, what x believes and what x desires to what x chooses to do. Moreover, the connections are said generally to mirror the semantic relations that hold among these contents, particularly relations that can be represented abstractly by rules of logic and rational argument such as modus ponens and the practical syllogism. Thus the theory theory posits an internal store of causal laws or principles corresponding to these rules. The following is the sort of principle one might call on to anticipate what a particular person will do, say, upon losing a credit card, given that undesirable consequences would ensue if they did not take action:

If S believes that if p, then (q unless S does x); and S desires that not-q; and S does not believe that if p and S does x, then something r will be the case such that S desires not-r more than S desires that p; etc., etc.; then, ceteris paribus, probably S will do x.

It seems implausible, however, to suppose that we must invoke such principles when we anticipate our own behavior in future contingent or counterfactual situations. To answer the question, "What would you do if your credit card were missing?" one would more likely use a simulative strategy. This is not to say that such a strategy is foolproof, or that we never employ generalizations in our own case. However, the generalizations we do sometimes employ tend to be not theoretical but behavioral descriptions: e.g., "I always become fatalistic in such situations," where "become fatalistic" and "such situations," though highly interpreted culture-bound descriptions, are not theoretical in any sense amenable to the theory theory: They do not describe the inner workings of a cognitive behavior control system, and they certainly do not constitute laws corresponding to rules of logic and reason.

Insofar as the store of causal generalizations mirrors the set of rules our own thinking typically conforms to, the simulation theory appears to render it otiose. For whatever rules our own thinking typically conforms to, our thinking continues to conform to them within the context of simulation, unless, of course, adjustments are made to accommodate evident differences. In short, we can use our own reasoning as a model of the reasoning of beings that reason the way we do. In the light of this alternative, it is argued, the hypothesis that people must be endowed with a special stock of laws corresponding to rules of logic and reason appears unmotivated and unparsimonious.

4. Areas of Empirical Investigation

Four main areas of empirical investigation have been thought especially relevant to the debate:

False belief. Taking into account another's ignorance or false belief when predicting or explaining their behavior requires imaginative modifications of one's own beliefs, according to the simulation theory. Thus the theory offers an explanation of the results of numerous experiments showing that younger children fail to take such factors into account. It would also explain the correlation, in autism, of failure to take into account ignorance or false belief and failure to engage in spontaneous pretend-play, particularly role play. Although these results can also be explained by certain versions of theory theory (and were so interpreted by the experimenters themselves), the simulation theory offers a new interpretation (Wimmer & Perner 1983, Gordon 1986).
Priority of self- or other-ascription. A second area of developmental research asks whether children ascribe mental states to themselves before they ascribe them to others. Versions of the simulation theory committed to the view that we recognize our own mental states as such and make analogical inferences to others' mental states seem to require an affirmative answer to this question; other versions of the theory seem to require a negative answer. Some experiments suggest a negative answer, but debate continues on this question (Gopnik & Wellman 1992).
Neural Simulation. For most versions of the simulation theory, a relevant empirical question, perhaps even the crucial question, is whether the neural mechanisms and processes employed in understanding and anticipating others' responses to the world significantly resemble those called on in our own "first person" responses to the world. There is now converging evidence that the human brain has systems that do double duty of the following kind: they may be activated either endogenously — for example, by the output of one's own decision-making, emotion-formation, or nociception (pain perception) systems — or exogenously, directly fed by the sight of other human faces and bodies. For example, the visceral responses characteristic of various emotions — the internal changes that give rise to the corresponding "gut feelings" — normally occur as the output of the processing of emotional stimuli. However, the same responses are also elicited when another's face is seen expressing the corresponding emotion. Further, there is evidence that damage to the somatosensory cortex that "reads" what is going on in one's viscera severely impairs one's ability to recognize the emotion expressed on another's face. Thus, recognition of facially expressed emotion appears to rely heavily on these exogenous, or other-induced, visceral responses. (Adolphs et al, 2000)
Indeed, much of our perception of the behavior of other human beings evidently takes place in such double duty systems. The neural processing that organizes our purposive behavior — actions such as reaching for an apple, grasping it, and bringing it to the mouth to eat it — normally occurs as the output of our decision-making processes. Yet a crucial part of that behavior-organizing processing has been found to occur exogenously, apparently as a part of a perceptual recognition system. Recently discovered in the premotor cortex of macaque monkeys and now known to exist also in humans, there are particular cells, so-called "mirror" neurons, that are activated under two distinct conditions: when the individual executes object-directed actions of a certain general type, and when the individual sees another individual performing actions of the same type. Some are activated, for example, when one is about to grasp an object, or sees another grasping an object, with either the hand or the mouth; and others are quite narrow in their selectivity, specific to grasping by hand, for example, and to objects calling for a particular kind of grip.

The evidence suggests that, by virtue of these double-duty systems, the sight of other (living) human or human-like bodies deposits in one's brain not just a visual representation of their behavior but also internal replicas of, among other things, the motor plans and visceral and nociceptive responses — and possibly even the lower-level intentions — that lie behind the behavior. It remains to be seen whether, and how, such bottom-up simulation might work together with cognitive processes, particularly the "putting-in-place" imaginative procedures that philosophers and psychologists describe: for example, whether and how mirror neurons might "talk" to the cognitive processes that underlie vicarious decision-making. (Gallese & Goldman 1998, Gordon 2004)
Cognitive impenetrability. Stich and Nichols suppose simulation to be "cognitively impenetrable" in that it operates independently of any general knowledge the simulator may have about human psychology. Yet they point to results suggesting that when subjects lack certain psychological information, they sometimes make incorrect predictions, and therefore must not be simulating (Stich & Nichols 1992). Because of problems of methodology and interpretation, as noted by a number of philosophers and psychologists, the cogency of this line of criticism is unclear.

Some philosophers think the simulation theory may shed light on issues in traditional philosophy of mind and language concerning intentionality, referential opacity, broad and narrow content, the nature of mental causation, Twin Earth problems, the problem of other minds, and the peculiarities of self-knowledge. Several philosophers have applied the theory to aesthetics, ethics, and philosophy of the social sciences. Success or failure of these efforts to answer philosophical problems may be considered empirical tests of the theory, in a suitably broad sense of "empirical."

Bibliography

Principal Sources:

Adolphs, R. et al., 2000, "A Role for Somatosensory Cortices in the Visual Recognition of Emotion as Revealed by Three-Dimensional Lesion Mapping," Journal of Neuroscience 20 (7), 2683-2690.
Gallese, V., 2001, "The ‘shared manifold’ hypothesis: from mirror neurons to empathy," Journal of Consciousness Studies, 8, 33-50.
Gallese, V., & Goldman, A., 1998, "Mirror neurons and the simulation theory of mind-reading," Trends in Cognitive Sciences, 2, 493-501.
Goldman, A., 1989, "Interpretation Psychologized." Mind and Language 4, 161-185; reprinted in Davies, M. and Stone T., eds., 1995, Folk Psychology: The Theory of Mind Debate. Oxford: Blackwell Publishers.
Gopnik, A. and Wellman, H.M., 1992: "Why the Child's Theory of Mind Really Is a Theory," Mind and Language 7, 145-71.
Gordon, R., 1986, "Folk Psychology as Simulation", Mind and Language 1, 158-171; reprinted in Davies, M. and Stone T., eds., 1995, Folk Psychology: The Theory of Mind Debate. Oxford: Blackwell Publishers.
Gordon, R., 1995, "Simulation Without Introspection or Inference From Me to You," in Mental Simulation: Evaluations and Applications, M. Davies & T. Stone (eds.), Oxford: Blackwell.
Gordon, R., 2004, "Intentional Agents Like Myself," in Perspectives on Imitation: From Neuroscience to Social Science, vol. 2, S. Hurley & N. Chater (eds.), Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Harris, P., 1989, Children and Emotion, Oxford: Blackwell Publishers.
Heal, J., 1986, "Replication and Functionalism", in Language, Mind, and Logic, J. Butterfield (ed.), Cambridge: Cambridge University Press; reprinted in Davies, M. and Stone T., eds., 1995, Folk Psychology: The Theory of Mind Debate. Oxford: Blackwell Publishers.
Hurley, S., 2004, "The Shared Circuits Hypothesis: A Unified Functional Architecture for Control, Imitation, and Simulation," in Perspectives on Imitation: From Neuroscience to Social Science, vol. 1, S. Hurley & N. Chater (eds.), Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Stich, S. & Nichols, S., 1992, "Folk psychology: Simulation or tacit theory?" Mind and Language 7, 35-71; reprinted in Davies, M. and Stone T., eds., 1995, Folk Psychology: The Theory of Mind Debate. Oxford: Blackwell Publishers.
Wimmer, H. and J. Perner, 1983, "Beliefs About Beliefs: Representation and Constraining Function of Wrong Beliefs in Young Children's Understanding of Deception," Cognition 13, 103-128.

Collections:

Carruthers, P. & Smith, P., eds., 1996, Theories of Theories of Mind. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Davies, M. and Stone T., eds., 1995, Folk Psychology: The Theory of Mind Debate. Oxford: Blackwell Publishers. (The introductory chapter offers an excellent overview and analysis of the initial debate.)
Davies, M. and Stone T., eds., 1995, Mental Simulation: Evaluations and Applications. Oxford: Blackwell Publishers.
Dokic, J. and Proust, J., eds., 2002, Simulation and Knowledge of Action. Advances in Consciousness Research 45, John Benjamins. ("The volume explores the two main versions of simulation theory, Goldman's introspectionism and Gordon's radical simulationism.")
Koegler, H. and Stueber, K., eds., 2000, Empathy and Agency: the Problem of Understanding in the Social Sciences, Westview Press. ("An anthology about the relevance of the simulation theory to philosophy of the social sciences")

Other Internet Resources

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Acknowledgments

A portion of this entry is excerpted, with permission, from "Simulation vs Theory Theory", MIT Encyclopedia of Cognitive Science (Cambridge, MA: MIT Press, 1999).