Supplement to Frege's Logic, Theorem, and Foundations for Arithmetic
Proof that 0 Falls Under Q
The proof that 0 falls under Q is relatively straightforward. We want to show:
[λy Precedes(y,#[λz Precedes+(z,y)])]0
By λ-Conversion, it suffices to show:
Precedes(0, #[λz Precedes+(z,0)])
So, by the definition of Predecessor, we have to show that there is a concept F and object x such that:
- Fx
- #[λz Precedes+(z,0)] = #F
- 0 = #[λu Fu & u≠x]
We can demonstrate that there is an F and x for which (1), (2) and (3) hold if we pick F to be [λz Precedes+(z,0)] and pick x to be 0. We now establish (1), (2), and (3) for these choices.
To show that (1) holds, we have to show:
[λz Precedes+(z,0)]0
But we know, from the definition of Precedes+, that Precedes+(0,0), So by abstraction using λ-Conversion, we are done.
To show that (2) holds, we need do no work, since our choice of F requires us to show:
#[λz Precedes+(z,0)] = #[λz Precedes+(z,0)],
which we know by the logic of identity.
To show (3) holds, we need to show:
(A) 0 = #[λu Precedes+(u,0) & u≠0]
[Note that the λ-expression in (A) has been simplified by applying λ-Conversion to the following (which, strictly speaking, is what results when you substitute our choice for F in (3)):
[λu [λz Precedes+(z,0)]u & u≠0]
In what follows, we use the simplified version of this λ-expression.]
To show (A), it suffices to show the following, in virtue of the Lemma Concerning Zero (in our subsection on The Concept Natural Number in §4):
¬∃x ([λu Precedes+(u,0) & u≠0]x)
And by λ-Conversion, it suffices to show:
(B) ¬∃x (Precedes+(x,0) & x≠0)
We establish (B) as follows.
When we established Theorem 2 (i.e., the fact that 0 is not the successor of any number), we proved that nothing precedes 0:
¬∃x Precedes(x,0)
From this, and Fact (4) about R* (in the subsection on the Ancestral of R, in §4), it follows that nothing ancestrally precedes 0:
¬∃x Precedes*(x,0)
Now suppose (for reductio) the negation of (B); i.e, that there is some object, say a, such that Precedes+(a,0) and a≠0. Then, by definition of Precedes+, it follows that either Precedes*(a,0) or a = 0. But since our reductio hypthesis includes that a≠0, it must be that Precedes*(a,0), which contradicts the fact displayed immediately above.
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