Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Notes to Implicature

1. Grice 1961: §3; 1975: 24; Harnish 1976: 328-9; Levinson 1983: 97; Leech 1983: 9; Neale 1992: 519, 528. Contrast Saul (2001: 632-3; 2002), who argues for a more normative reading.

2. See Grice 1975: 87ff; Harnish 1976: 332ff; Bach 1994; Levinson 2000: 170ff.

3. In the literature on implicature, what an utterance implicates is generally equated with what the speaker implicates rather than what the sentence implicates.

4. See also Boër & Lycan (1973); Harnish (1976: 341-2); Sadock (1978: 373); Atlas (1979: 274); Levinson (1983: 131); Neale (1992: 540-1).

5. See McKay 1981; Berg 1988, 1998; Salmon 1986, 1989; Soames 1987a, 1989, 1995.

6. Horn (1972: ch. 4; 1989: §4.5); Levinson (1983: 164); Hirschberg (1991: 47).

7. See Grice (1975: 30-31; 1978: 41; 1981: 185); Harnish (1976: 333), R. Lakoff (1977: 99), Brown & Levinson (1978: 63), Bach & Harnish (1979: xvii, 6), Atlas (1979: 272), Posner (1980), Wilson & Sperber (1981: 160), Levinson (1983: 113; 2000: 15), G. M. Green (1989: 93-97), Fasold (1990: 131-132), Hirschberg (1991: 16-24), Berg (1991), Blakemore (1992: 126, 137), Neale (1992: 527), and M. S. Green (1995: 98). For antecedents to Grice, see Hungerland (1960). See M. S. Green (2002) for an important difference between the given formulation and Grice's.

8. See Böer & Lycan (1973: 498-505), Searle (1975: 267), Morgan (1978: 246, 250, 252), R. Lakoff (1977: 99), Sadock (1978: 368; 1981: 258, 261-262), Gazdar (1979: 41-42), Bach & Harnish (1979: 169, 171), Atlas (1979: 273, 276; 1989: 139-140), Grice (1975: 31; 1981: 187), Nunberg (1981: 201, 207-208), Horn (1984: 13; 1989: 383; 1992: 260-262), Levinson (1983: 100, 113-114, 117; 2000: 15), Leech (1983: 11, 17, 24-25, 30-31, 44, 153, 172), Fasold (1990: 132), Neale (1992: 527), Schiffrin (1994: 194-195, 367), and M. S. Green (1995: esp. §3).

9. The Generative Assumption has also been widely assimilated. See e.g., Stalnaker (1974: 476), Searle (1975: 266), Harnish (1976: 330, 332), Sadock (1978: 366), McCawley (1978: 245), Bach & Harnish (1979: 167, 169, 171), Gazdar (1979: 51), Levinson (1983: 99-100), Leech (1983: 9, 91-92), Lycan (1984: 75-76), Martinich (1984: 510), Thomason (1990: 330, 350, 352, 355-357), Fasold (1990: 129-130), and Schiffrin (1994: 193).

10. Grice (1978: 47). See also Ziff (1960: 44), Cohen (1971: 56), Stalnaker (1974: 475), Walker (1975: 158ff), Kempson (1975: 142), Searle (1975: 269), McCawley (1978: 257-258), Sadock (1981: 258), Atlas & Levinson (1981: 56), Sperber & Wilson (1981: 317), Wilson & Sperber (1981: 155), Levinson (1983: 97-100, 132; 2000: 15), Leech (1983: 48, 88), Bach (1987: 69, 77-79), Blakemore (1987: 21), Schiffer (1987b: §IV), Horn (1989: 213-214, 365, 383), and Neale (1992: 535-41).

11. These principles are usually formulated as normative injunctions, but Griceans presumably have in mind the associated descriptive principles to the effect that speakers regularly do what the norms enjoin them to do.

12. It would fit well with Grice's general conception to strengthen condition (iii) to require that S intend H to able to determine that the belief that p is required for S to be cooperative. But even this is far from sufficient for implicature. Suppose that S says “He was there,” and that S intends H to be able to determine that for this remark to contribute to the accepted purpose of the contribution, S must believe that he is describing the subject of conversation. It does not follow that S in any way meant that he is describing that subject.

13. Kroch (1972); Kempson (1975: 152-156); Harnish (1976: 332, 334, 352); Gazdar (1979: 57ff); Horn (1989: 15, 18-19, 332-335); Sadock (1978: 369); Levinson (1983: 122; 2000: 80); Sperber & Wilson (1986a: 37, 93; 1987: 699); Brown & Levinson (1987: 11); and Thomason (1990: 353-356).

14. Here Levinson refers to the Maxim of Quantity in justifying the inference rule “What is not said, isn't.” In later work (2000: 31-2, 35), he maintains that the inference rule “motivates” the maxim.

15. Cf. Kempson (1975: 144, 159), Leech (1983: 23), Martinich 1984: 511; Sperber & Wilson (1987: 705-706), Fasold (1990: 132). Contrast Davis (1998: §3.4) and Saul (2001: 234-5).

16. See also Davison (1975), Lakoff (1977), Brown & Levinson (1978; 1987), Bird (1979: 143), Holdcroft (1979: 140), Horn (1989: 360), Fasold (1990: 159-166), and Matsumoto (1995: §2.4). Grice (1975: 28) acknowledges the Principle of Politeness, and suggests that it generates implicatures that are both nonconventional and nonconversational.

17. See Sperber & Wilson (1986a: 1986b; 1987; 1995), Kempson (1986), Carston (1987), Recanati (1987), and Blakemore (1987a; 1992). For wide-ranging criticism of the theory, along with replies from Sperber and Wilson, see Behavioral and Brain Studies, 10, 1987, 697-754. See also Levinson's (1989) judicious and synoptic review.

18. See also Sperber & Wilson (1986a: 46-51, 118-171; 1986b; 1987: 702-704). Some formulations suggest that Sperber and Wilson are saying that speakers should maximize contextual effects and minimize cost; but this formulation simply conjoins two principles that can and usually do conflict. In yet other formulations, Sperber and Wilson define the Principle of Relevance as the thesis that there is a presumption that the speaker is communicating something maximally or optimally relevant (see e.g., Sperber & Wilson 1987: 704); on this take, the principle is more akin to Grice's cooperative presumption than to his Cooperative Principle.

19. Both my analysis and Grice's have qualifications that are unimportant in the present context.

20. Cf. Grice (1957:222); Neale (1992: 530, 555). Given the common but confused idea that “implicatures” are “inferences,” disambiguating inferences and the like are sometimes called “explicatures.” Cf. Sperber & Wilson (1986a); Kempson (1986); Cartson (1988: 158); Levinson (2000: 190-5).

21. See Lewis (1969, 1975) and (Davis 2003: Ch. 8) for analyses of convention and further references.

22. Compare and contrast Levinson 2000: 16-21, who maintains that a generalized conversational implicature is a “default interpretation.” This holds only if the sentence does not have more than one conventional implicature. Consider “p and q,” which implicates “q because p” on some occasions, and “p before q” on others. The same problem undermines Saul's (2001: 638) suggestion that implicatures can be worked out because information about implicature conventions is part of the background information used as a premise in the working-out schema.

23. Cf. Searle (1975: 274), G. M. Green (1975; 1987: 107), Morgan (1978), Kates (1980: 126), Horn (1989: 29, 344, 347-349), Wierzbicka (1987), Adler (1987: 711), S. Russell (1987: 731), Fasold (1990: 155-157), Bach (1995), Davis (1998: Chs.5 and 6), and Levinson (2000: 23-4).

24. Cf. Sadock (1974: 97-98), Cole (1975: §viii), Morgan (1978: 250), Brown & Levinson (1978: 221, 265-267), Cowie, Mackin, & McCaig (1983: xii), Cruse (1986: 44), Anttila (1989: 38, 137-146), Cowie (1994: 3168), and Geurts (1998: 296).