Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Notes to The Problem of Induction

1. Zabell points out in (Zabell 2007) that W. E. Johnson in (Johnson 1924, vol. III, 178 - 189) defines exchangeability ("Permutation-Postulate") and proves some proto-Carnapian consequences.

2. Thanks to Patrick Maher for helpful comments.

3. There is some terminological confusion about this.: For Williams an “inverse inference of probability” is a “deduction of the probability of p in relation to q from knowledge of the probability of q in relation to p.” (As in Bayes' law, for example.) (Williams 1947, 190) Stove (Stove 1986, 56–58) says that “what used to be called ”inverse inference“ is inference from frequency to probability, while direct inference is just the converse; inference from probability to frequency.” In the interests of clarity the present entry uses the Carnapian taxonomy throughout: Inverse inference infers something about a population from premises about a sample from that population.

4. Recall that a probability is symmetrical if it is invariant for permutations of individual constants.

5. Stove specifies spatial and temporal limits on this population. These details are ignored here.