Supplement to Propositional Attitude Reports
Ignorance of identities
Lois is, in some intuitive sense, ignorant of something concerning who Superman is and this ignorance both explains and justifies Lois's believing of Superman that he is strong and that he is not strong. (For more on the notion of believing of, see the supplementary document on The De Re/De Dicto Distinction.) But what does this ignorance consist in; just what is it that Lois doesn't know? We want to say that she doesn't realize that Clark Kent is Superman. She believes of Superman that he is strong because she believes that Superman is strong (and she doesn't believe that Superman is not strong) and that she believes of Superman that he is not strong because she believes that Clark Kent is not strong (and she doesn't believe that Clark Kent is strong). This only makes sense, however, if Lois doesn’t believe that Clark Kent is Superman. But this is contentious and some participants in the debate — in particular, naive Russellians — deny it. (See the section on The Naive Russellian theory.) Why is this, you might ask? Well, according to naive Russellians, Lois's believing that Superman is Clark Kent just is her believing that Superman is Superman, and surely she believes that.
We seek a description of Lois's ignorance that all parties can accept. The unduly meta-linguistic way of stating what Lois is ignorant of in the main body of the text is, however, inadequate. There we said that she does not recognize that ‘Clark Kent’ and ‘Superman’ refer to the same person. But it may be that Lois doesn't recognize that ‘Clark Kent’ and ‘Superman’ refer to the same person simply because she doesn't think about the reference of her words. So, Lois might be like, for example, a two-year old who simply doesn't have meta-linguistic concepts needed to even entertain that thought. Still, however, she might be confused about who Superman is.
We might say that Lois doesn't realize that the person she works with is the same as the person who saves her from falling buildings. But this fails for a similar reason to the suggestion above. This may fail to accurately characterize her cognitive state as she may simply have never thought of Clark Kent as the person I work with. In that case, she may not realize that the person she works with is the person who saves her from falling buildings even in cases in which we would not want to say of her that she doesn't realize that Clark Kent is Superman.
Still, it is clear what we are getting at with these descriptions of Lois. There is some sense in which Lois thinks of a single person as two distinct people. She doesn't realize that the person who appears thusly and that she thinks about in this way — say, "under" the name ‘Clark Kent’ — is the same person as the person who appears suchly and that she thinks about in that way — say, "under" the name ‘Superman’; and this failure of realization is not just due to the fact that she hasn't happened to take a stand on these matters.
Those who reject naive Russellianism have an easier time. They can simply say that the explanation and justification of Lois's believing of Superman that he is strong and that he is not strong is due ultimately to her not believing that Superman is Clark Kent. The difficulties in stating what Lois is ignorant of are really only problems for proponents of naive Russellianism.