Notes to Quantum Approaches to Consciousness

1. This statement reflects a philosophical position which is known as incompatibilism. It is more or less implicitly shared by most scientists thinking about the options quantum theory offers for free will. On a compatibilist presumption, free will does not necessarily contradict determinism. For more details see the volume by Kane (1996), who invokes indeterministic quantum events in his own account of free will.

2. Although materialism and physicalism are often used interchangeably, it is useful to distinguish them if one does not wish to commit oneself to the assumption that neurobiology is completely reducible to fundamental physics. For this reason, I will refer to the material rather than the physical throughout this entry.

3. See Bishop and Atmanspacher (2006) and Atmanspacher and beim Graben (2006) for a more detailed discussion of physical examples of contextual conditions in the description of emergent properties.

4. A less controversial notion in addressing this issue could be in terms of constraints that mental state impose on brain states.

5. The abbreviation NMDA refers to N-methyl-D-aspartate, the synthetic agonist that activates NMDA receptors.

6. Notice that von Neumann's chain of observing systems stays always in the material domain. When he refers to subjective (mental) experiences, he presupposes some psychophysical parallelism allowing him to treat these experiences as brain processes.

7. In his later writings, he repudiated this point of view about the role of consciousness, stating that "it is outside the realm of quantum mechanics" (Wigner, 1977).

8. A critical discussion of the problems for Wigner's approach to measurement, together with the presentation of alternatives, can be found in Primas (1997).

9. Margenau's notion of latent observables (Margenau, 1950) and d'Espagnat's notion of an independent reality (d'Espagnat, 1999) are similar ways to achieve such an ontological interpretation of quantum theory. Another distinction relevant in this context is that of epistemic and ontic descriptions (Atmanspacher and Primas, 2003).

10. Related proposals based on a similar idea are due to Fröhlich (1968) and Pribram (1971).

11. Interestingly, a recent study shows that gravitation seems to be necessary for the development of an ordered network of microtubuli (Papaseit et al., 2000). But there is no obvious relation between this result and objective state reduction.

12. Emphatically, Spencer-Brown (1969, Chap. 1) proposed such a procedure as the basis of all cognitive activity: “We take as given the idea of distinction and the idea of indication, and that we cannot make an indication without drawing a distinction.”

13. The pioneering quantum conception of information is von Weizsäcker's ur-theory (Weizsäcker, 1985), most prominent is Wheeler's ‘it from bit’ (Wheeler, 1994), most recent are proposals by Zeilinger (Brukner and Zeilinger, 2003), Fuchs (2002), and Clifton etal. (2003). See also Chalmers (1996) for a discussion of information-based dual aspects.

14. It is obvious that the term ‘mental’ is used here with a connotation more general than that of consciousness. Preconscious, subconscious, and unconscious domains, personal and collective, are included as well.

15. Another proposal (Atmanspacher, 2003), based on a similar idea, implements temporal features differently.