Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Supplement to Defeasible Reasoning

Popper Functions

A Popper function is a function from pairs of propositions to real numbers that satisfies the following conditions:

  1. For some D, E, P[D|E] ≠ 1.
  2. P[A|A] = 1.
  3. P[A|(C & B)] = P[A|(B & C)].
  4. P[(B & A)|C] = P[(A & B)|C].
  5. P[A|B] + PA|B] = 1, or P[C|B] = 1.
  6. P[(A & B)|C] = P[A|(B & C)] × P[B|C].