Supplement to Aristotle's Political Theory
Presuppositions of Aristotle's Politics
Aristotle's political philosophy is distinguished by its underlying philosophical doctrines. Of these the following four principles are especially noteworthy:
(1) The principle of teleology Aristotle begins the Politics by invoking the concept of nature (see Political Naturalism). In the Physics Aristotle identifies the nature of a thing above all with its end or final cause (Phys. II.2.194a28-9, 8.199b15-18). The end of a thing is also its function (EE II.1.1219a8), which is its defining principle (Meteor. IV.12.390a10-11). On Aristotle's view plants and animals are cardinal examples of natural existents, because they have a nature in the sense of an internal causal principle which explains how it comes into being and behaves (Phys. II.1.192b32-3). For example, an acorn has an inherent tendency to grow into an oak tree, so that the tree exists by nature rather than by craft or by chance. The thesis that human beings have a natural function has a fundamental place in the Eudemian Ethics II.1, Nicomachean Ethics I.7, and Politics I.2. The Politics further argues that it is part of the nature of human beings that they are political or adapted for life in the city-state. Thus teleology is crucial for the political naturalism which is at the foundation of Aristotle's political philosophy. (For discussion of teleology see the entry on Aristotle's biology.)
(2) The principle of perfection Aristotle understands good and evil in terms of his teleology. The natural end of the organism (and the means to this end) is good for it, and what defeats or impedes this end is bad. For example, he argues that animals sleep in order to preserve themselves, because "nature operates for the sake of an end, and this is a good," and sleeping is necessary and beneficial for entities which cannot move continuously (De Somno 2.455b17-22). For human beings the ultimate good or happiness (eudaimonia) consists in perfection, the full attainment of their natural function, which Aristotle analyzes as the activity of the soul according to reason (or not without reason), i.e., activity in accordance with the most perfect virtue or excellence (EN I.7.1098a7-17). This also provides a norm for the politician: "What is most choiceworthy for each individual is always the highest it is possible for him to attain" (Pol. VII.14.1333a29-30; cf. EN X.7.1177b33-4). This ideal is to be realized in both the individual and the city-state: "that way of life is best, both separately for each individual and in common for city-states, which is equipped with virtue" (Pol. VII.1.1323b40-1324a1). However, Aristotle recognizes that it is generally impossible to fully realize this ideal, in which case he invokes a fall-back principle: it is best to attain perfection, but, failing that, a thing is better in proportion as it is nearer to the end (see DC II.12.292b17-19).
Aristotle's perfectionism was opposed to the subjective relativism of Protagoras, according to which good and evil is defined by whatever human beings happened to desire. Like Plato, Aristotle maintained that the good was objective and independent of human wishes. However, he rejected Plato's own theory that the good was defined in terms of a transcendent form of the good, holding instead that good and evil are in a way relative to the organism, that is, to its natural end.
(3) The principle of community Aristotle maintains that the city-state is the most complete community, because it attains the limit of self-sufficiency, so that it can exist for the sake of the good life (Pol. I.2.1252b27-30). Individuals outside of the city-state are not self-sufficient, because they depend on the community not only for material necessities but also for education and moral habituation. "Just as, when perfected, a human is the best of animals, so also when separated from law and justice, he is the worst of all" (1253a31-3). On Aristotle's view, then, human beings must be subject to the authority of the city-state in order to attain the good life. The following principle concerns how authority should be exercised within a community.
(4) Principle of rulership Aristotle believes that the existence and well-being of any system requires the presence of a ruling element: "Whenever a thing is established out of a number of things and becomes a single common thing, there always appears in it a ruler and ruled. . . . This [relation] is present in living things, but it derives from all of nature." (1254a28-32)
Just as an animal or plant can survive and flourish only if its soul rules over its body (Pol. I.5.1254a34-6, DA I.5.410b10-15; compare Plato Phaedo 79e-80a), a human community can possess the necessary order only if it has a ruling element which is in a position of authority, just as an army can possess order only if it has a commander in control. Although Aristotle followed Plato on this principle, he rejected Plato's further claim that one form of rule is appropriate for all. For Aristotle different forms of rule are necessary for different systems: e.g., political rule for citizens and despotic rule for slaves. The imposition of an inappropriate type of rule results in disorder and injustice.
The aforementioned principles account for much of the distinctive flavor of Aristotle's political philosophy, and they also indicate where many modern theorists have turned away from him. Modern philosophers such as Thomas Hobbes have challenged the principles of teleology and perfectionism, arguing against the former that human beings are mechanistic rather than teleological systems, and against the latter that good and bad depend upon subjective preferences of valuing agents rather than on objective states of affairs. Liberal theorists have criticized the principle of community on the grounds that it cedes too much authority to the state. Even the principle of rulership which Aristotle, Plato, and many other theorists thought self-evident has come under fire by modern theorists like Adam Smith and F. A. Hayek who argued that social and economic order may arise spontaneously as if by an "invisible hand." Modern neo-Aristotelian political theorists are committed to defending one or more of these doctrines against such criticisms.