Notes to Samuel Clarke

1. As with other theological matters, Newton may have held similar views to Clarke about the nature of matter, space, and God’s role in the world, but he was hesitant to draw these conclusions publicly. Similar views do appear in Newton’s private correspondence (e.g., letters to Bentley on December 10, 1692 & January 17, 1693).

2. Collins mentions More, Turner, and Clarke among the supporters of the dimensional extension of God: A. Collins, A Discourse of Free Thinking (London, 1713), pp. 47-8.

3. P. Des Maizeaux, Recueil de diverses piéces…par Mrs. Leibniz, Clarke, Newton, & autre autheurs celébres (Amsterdam, 1720), tome 1, p. v. Koyrè and Cohen have shown that the Avertissement was written by Newton by publishing the several drafts by his own hand. However, as they themselves point out, there is no reason to doubt that Clarke contributed to it. See their “Newton & the Leibniz-Clarke Correspondence,” Archives Internationales d'Histoire des Sciences 15 (1962), 63-126, especially 95.

4. See especially Prop. XXV (W IV.150); Prop. XXVII (W IV.151); Prop. XXXIV (W IV.155).