A Quantitative Version of a Draper-Style Argument
| (1) |
Pr(O/HI) >
Pr(O/T) + k |
(Substantive premise) |
| (2) |
Pr(O/HI) =
Pr(O &
HI)/Pr(HI) |
(Definition of conditional probability) |
Therefore,
| (3) |
Pr(O &
HI)/Pr(HI) >
Pr(O/T) + k |
(From (1) and (2).) |
| (4) |
Pr(O/T) =
Pr(O &
T)/Pr(T) |
(Definition of conditional probability) |
Therefore,
| (5) |
Pr(O &
HI)/Pr(HI) >
Pr(O &
T)/Pr(T) + k |
(From (3) and (4).) |
| (6) |
Pr(O & HI) =
Pr(HI/O) ×
Pr(O) |
(From the definition of conditional probability) |
Therefore
| (7) |
Pr(O & HI)/Pr(HI) = Pr(HI/O) ×
Pr(O)/Pr(HI) |
(From (6).) |
Therefore,
| (8) |
Pr(HI/O) ×
Pr(O)/Pr(HI) >
Pr(O &
T)/Pr(T) + k |
(From (5) and (7).) |
| (9) |
Pr(O & T) =
Pr(T/O) ×
Pr(O) |
(From the definition of conditional probability) |
Therefore,
| (10) |
Pr(O & T)/Pr(T) =
Pr(T/O) ×
Pr(O)/Pr(T) |
(From (9).) |
Therefore,
| (11) |
Pr(HI/O) ×
Pr(O)/Pr(HI) >
Pr(T/O) ×
Pr(O)/Pr(T) + k |
(From (8) and (10).) |
| (12) |
Pr(O/HI) > 0 |
(From (1).) |
| (13) |
Pr(HI) > 0, |
(Substantive premise) |
| (14) |
Pr(OI/HI) ×
Pr(HI) = Pr(O & HI) =
Pr(HI/O) ×
Pr(O) |
(From the definition of conditional probability) |
Therefore,
| (15) |
Pr(O) > 0, |
(From (12), (13), and (14).) |
so that
Pr(HI)/Pr(O) is
defined. Therefore, we can multiply both sides of (11) by
Pr(HI)/Pr(O) which
gives:
| (16) |
Pr(HI/O) >
Pr(T/O) ×
Pr(HI)/Pr(T) +
k ×
Pr(HI)/Pr(O) |
|
| (17) |
HI entails ~T |
(Substantive premise) |
Therefore,
| (18) |
Pr(~T/O)
≥
Pr(HI/O) |
(From (17).) |
Therefore,
| (19) |
Pr(~T/O) >
Pr(T/O) ×
Pr(HI)/Pr(T) +
k ×
Pr(HI)/Pr(O) |
(From (16) and (18).) |
| (20) |
Pr(HI)
≥
Pr(T) |
(Substantive premise) |
Therefore,
| (21) |
Pr(~T/O) >
Pr(T/O) + k ×
Pr(HI)/Pr(O) |
(From (19) and (20).) |
| (22) |
O entails [(T &
O) or (~T &
O)] and [(T &
O) or (~T &
O)] entails O |
(Logical truth) |
Therefore,
| (23) |
Pr(T &
O) +
Pr(~T &
O) = Pr(O) |
(From (22).) |
Then, in view of (15), we can divide both sides of (23) by
Pr(O), which gives us:
| (24) |
Pr(T &
O)/Pr(O) +
Pr(~T &
O)/Pr(O) =
Pr(O)/Pr(O) = 1 |
Therefore,
| (25) |
Pr(T/O) +
Pr(~T/O) = 1 |
(From (24).) |
Therefore,
| (26) |
Pr(T) < 0.5 -
k × Pr(HI)/2
×Pr(O) |
(From (21) and (25).) |
Return to The Problem of Evil
