Notes to Ibn Kammuna

1. The most thorough analyses of this key chapter in the history of psychology, and the basis for all subsequent research (even if not always given their proper due by some scholars), remain the two articles of Shlomo Pines, “La Conception de la Conscience de soi chez Avicenne et chez Abu'l-Barakat al-Baghdadi” (1954) and “Studies in Abu'l-Barakat's Poetics and Metaphysics” (1960), both of which are reprinted in the first volume of The Collected Works of Shlomo Pines (Jerusalem and Leiden, 1979). There are some passing references to Ibn Kammuna in these seminal studies.

2. Interpretations differ concerning the precise role of intuition in Suhrawardi's thought; for a good overview, see Roxanne Marcotte, “Philosophical Reason vs. Mystical Intuition, Shihab al-Din Suhrawardi (d. 1191),” Anaquel des Estudios Árabes, 7 (1996), 109-125.

3. All references are to the edition of S.H.S. Musawi, published in Kheradname-ye Sadra 8 (2003), 64-86; for further information on this treatise, see Pourjavady & Schmidtke, 92-3. All translation from the Arabic are mine.

4. Dimitri Gutas, Avicenna and the Aristotelian Tradition, Leiden: Brill, p. 176; see also, p. 78, where the term appears in a letter written by an anonymous disciple of Ibn Sina. For the Sufi usage see, e.g., Annemarie Schimmel, Mystical Dimensions of Islam, Chapel Hill: University of North Carolina, 1975, p. 193.

5. For some examples of such snippets, as well as further discussion of the assimilation of Islamic piety among some Jews in the Yemen, see Y. Tzvi Langermann, “Saving the Soul by Knowing the Soul: A Medieval Yemeni Interpretation of Song of Songs,” Journal of Jewish Thought and Philosophy 12 (2003), 147-166.

6. Our account here is based upon the Arabic text of Ibn Kammuna transcribed in Pourjavady and Schmidtke, p. 45 n. 201, and al-Tusi's reply, published there on pp. 209-210. In addition to the manuscripts listed by Pourjavady and Schmidtke, interested readers can be referred now to an online resource, Manuscript 35 in the Minasian collection at UCLA, 160ff., digitized images of which have been made public.