Supplement to The Analysis of Knowledge
Knowledge and Skepticism
- 1. The Skeptical Paradox
- 2. The Relevant Alternatives Theory
- 3. Moore-Type Anti-Skepticism
- 4. The Ambiguity Response
- 5. Fallibilist Anti-Skepticism
- 6. The Contextualist Response
1. The Skeptical Paradox
Skeptics claim that we know radically less than we think we do. For example, skeptics might claim that we have next to no knowledge of the past, the future, or other minds. Here we will consider the skeptical claim that we have next to no knowledge of the external world: the world of physical objects that we at least seem to perceive. One well-known argument in support of this claim appeals to the possibility of being a BIV: a brain in a vat. According to the BIV Hypothesis, you are a mere BIV without a normal body. This of course means, among other things, that you don't have hands. The nerve endings of your brain are stimulated in a manner so sophisticated that the perfect illusion of a normal life is generated. Let's distinguish between the vat world and (what you take to be) the normal world. According to the BIV Hypothesis, your introspective and perceptual experiences, your memories, thoughts, fears, and desires -- in short, the totality of your mental states -- in the vat world mirror those you have in the normal world. Hence, according to the skeptical argument, there is nothing you can appeal to that would give you a reason to think that the vat world is not the actual world. You have no evidence whatever for thinking that you are not a BIV. So you don't know that you are not a BIV. That's one of the premises on which the skeptical conclusion is based.
As already mentioned, in the vat world, you don't have hands. Since you can't distinguish between the normal world and the vat world, you can't distinguish between having and not having hands, and therefore can't tell whether or not you have hands. Thus we get the other premise of the argument: If you don't know that you are not a BIV, then you don't know that you have hands.
The skeptical argument against knowledge of the external world, then, goes as follows:
The BIV Argument:
(C) If I don't know that I am not a BIV, then I don't know that I have hands. (~K~B) I don't know that I am not a BIV. Therefore: (~KH) I don't know that I have hands.
The conclusion of the BIV Argument mentions just one example of what you don't know if you don't know that you are not a BIV. For example, you wouldn't know either what time it is, what your present location is, what your gender is, who your parents are, and so forth. So if the BIV Argument is sound, we must conclude that our knowledge of the external world is rather limited.
The conclusion, ~KH, strikes us as obviously false. The premises, however, seem highly plausible. That's why the argument presents us with a paradox. Responding to this paradox raises a dilemma. We can either accept the premises but must then accept a conclusion that strikes us as crazy. Alternatively, we can deny the conclusion, but must then explain which of the argument's seemingly plausible premises is false.
Next, we will consider four different responses to the BIV Argument.
2. The Relevant Alternatives Theory (RAT)
Advocates of RAT reject the first premise of the BIV Argument.[1] The motivation underlying this premise arises from a general principle (let an alternative to p be any proposition that is incompatible with p):
The Elimination of Alternatives Principle
If I know that p, and I know that q is an alternative to p, then I know (or I am at least in a position to know) that q is false.[2]
The Elimination of Alternatives Principle seems to guarantee the success of the BIV Argument. You know that your being a BIV is an alternative to your having hands: If you have hands, then you are not a BIV. If you are a BIV, then you don't have hands. Now, you cannot, it would appear, discriminate between the normal world and the vat world, and thus cannot know that you are not a BIV. But your having hands is incompatible with your being a BIV. Hence, it would seem, if the Elimination of Alternatives Principle is true, you cannot know that you have hands.
So it looks like the BIV Argument stands or falls with the Elimination of Alternatives Principle. Advocates of RAT suggest, therefore, to get rid of it. As a replacement, they suggest the following modification of it: to know that p, you must merely be in a position to know the falsehood of all relevant known alternatives to p. So according to RAT, the following principle is true:
The Elimination of Relevant Alternatives Principle
If I know that p, and I know that q is an alternative to p, then I know (or I am at least in a position to know) that q is false — provided q is a relevant alternative to p.
A canary is, just like a goldfinch, a little yellow bird. Thus when it comes to a task such as classifying the bird in your yard as a goldfinch, its being a canary is a relevant alternative.[3] A Ferrari is, just like a Lamborghini, a slick-looking, expensive sports car. Hence, when you take yourself to know that the car you are seeing a Lamborghini, its being a Ferrari is a relevant alternative. Proponents of RAT would argue, however, that in neither of these two cases is your being a BIV a relevant alternative. To know that the bird in your yard is a goldfinch, you must know that it's not a canary, but you need not know that you are not a BIV. Likewise, to know that the car you are seeing is a Lamborghini, you must know that it's not a Ferrari, but you need not know that you are not a BIV.
RAT is faced with three serious problems. Consider the proposition ‘I have hands'. Is the BIV alternative relevant with regard to that proposition? If not, why not? If it is relevant, then RAT is not an effective response to the BIV Argument, for then we still end up with the conclusion that you don't know that you have hands. So for RAT to succeed, its advocates would have to answer the following questions: What are the criteria of relevance? How can we decide, when it comes to knowing that I have hands, whether my being a BIV is a relative alternative?[4]
A second problem for RAT arises from the Elimination of Relevant Alternatives Principle. Suppose that the proposition ‘I am a BIV’ is not a relevant alternative to the proposition ‘I have hands'. If so, you can know that you have hands without knowing that you are not a BIV. But then we get the possibility of what has become known as an ‘abominable conjunction’: I know that I have hands, but I do not know that I am not a (handless) BIV.[5] Opponents of RAT would argue that this conjunction is so counter-intuitive that it may be viewed as a reductio ad absurdum of any theory that entails it as one of the theory's consequences.
The third problem arises because the Elimination of Alternatives Principle, which RAT rejects, enjoys a rather high degree of plausibility. Unless the theory is backed up with a principled account stating criteria of relevance, the rejection of the principle in favor of the Elimination of Relevant Alternatives Principle seems ad hoc, motivated not by an independent rationale but merely by the desire to rebut the BIV Argument.
3. Moore-Type Anti-Skepticism
G. E. Moore pointed out that skeptical arguments can be turned on their head. Moreover, he famously attempted to prove the existence of the external world by presenting his hands and saying ‘Here is one hand, and there is another.’[6] Applying this strategy, we could reject the second premise of the BIV Argument as follows:
Moorean Anti-BIV:
(C) If I don't know that I am not a BIV, then I don't know that I have hands. (KH) I know that I have hands. Therefore: (K~B) I know that I am not a BIV.
It seems crazy to deny that we know we have hands. So why not take our knowledge of our hands as a starting point for arguing that, since we know we have hands, we therefore know we are not BIVs?
The problem with Moorean Anti-BIV is that it seems to be a case of question begging. If indeed I have no evidence in support of my belief that I am not a BIV, it is unclear how I can know that I am not a BIV. If we find the first premise plausible, it becomes therefore unclear how I can know that I have hands — for if I were a BIV, then I would not have any hands. How, then, can it be a satisfactory response to the BIV-Argument to simply assume that I have hands, and deduce from this assumption that I know I'm not a BIV? Consider an analogy. Suppose we mean by ‘God’ an omnipotent, omniscient, and benevolent being that created the world. A well-known argument against the existence of God goes as follows:
The Argument from Evil (AFE):
(E~G) If Evil exists, then God does not exist. (E) Evil exists. Therefore: (~G) God does not exist.
Suppose the Theist responds as follows:
Anti-AFE:
(E~G) If evil exists, then God does not exist. (G) God exists. Therefore: (~E) Evil does not exist.
It seems clear that Anti-AFE begs the question against AFE, and so is not a good response to AFE. There is overwhelming, antecedent evidence in support of E: Evil exists, that much is hardly contestable. As a result, AFE succeeds in casting serious doubt on the existence of God. That's why, in appealing to the existence of God as a premise, Anti-AFE begs the question against AFE.
If Anti-AFE and Moorean Anti-BIV are analogous, then the charge that Moorean Anti-BIV begs the question sticks. Many epistemologists would say that the two arguments are indeed analogous. To the extent E is plausible, G is implausible. Therefore, denying E on the basis of G is illegitimate. A properly justified rejection of E must not appeal to the existence of God. Likewise, ~K~B enjoys a good deal of antecedent plausibility, thus calling KH into question. Therefore, denying ~K~B on the basis of KH is not a legitimate move but rather a case of question begging. A properly justified rejection of ~K~B must be based on a ground other than KH.[7]
Suppose, on the other hand, good evidence for believing "I'm not a BIV" is actually available. In the next section, we will assume we know that the know-how and technology needed for successful envatment (for making a mere brain think it's a normal person having an ordinary life) does not exist. Arguably, we know this in pretty much the same way in which we know that the easter bunny, the Loch Ness monster, and the abominable snowman do not exist. Such creatures belong, we know, to the realm of fiction just as much as BIVs. If that is correct, there would then be a crucial difference between the BIV Argument and Moorean Anti-BIV on the one hand, and AFE and Anti-AFE on the other hand. For if we have excellent evidence for believing that BIVs don't exist, then the second premise of the BIV Argument would be, unlike the second premise of AFE, implausible. The BIV Argument would then fail to succeed in calling the existence of my hands in question. As a result, I would not beg the question if I employed Moorean Anti-BIV as a response to the BIV Argument.[8]
4. The Ambiguity Response
Let us distinguish between the concept of knowledge and the word ‘knowledge’. Should we take it for granted that, when you and I use the word ‘knowledge’, we mean the same, that is, have the same concept of knowledge in mind? According to the Ambiguity Response, we should not take this for granted. Obviously, there are many different concepts of knowledge. Knowledge might be viewed as:
- true belief;
- justified true belief;
- justified, true, and degettiered belief;
- reliably formed true belief.
When we use the word knowledge in ordinary life, sometimes we have (A) in mind. At other times, we don't attribute knowledge of p to a person unless we think that person has a good reason for p. Then we have (B) in mind. Those who have taken an epistemology course might replace (B) with (C). And sometimes we attribute knowledge to our pets. Then it would seem we have something like (A) or (D) in mind.
It would appear, then, that what we mean when we use the word ‘know’ can vary from one situation to another. Hence, when the Skeptic and the Anti-Skeptic disagree on what we know, we must distinguish between two possibilities. First, it might be that they have exactly the same concept of knowledge in mind. In that case, their disagreement is substantive. It can't be that both of them are right. One of them must be mistaken. Second, it might be that they have different concepts of knowledge in mind. If so, their disagreement will be merely verbal. As a result, they might both be right.
According to the ambiguity response, the use of the word ‘know’ in the BIV-Argument can be interpreted in two different ways. According to the first interpretation, the argument is sound but yields an innocuous conclusion. According to the second interpretation, the BIV Argument has an interesting and indeed disturbing conclusion, but fails to be sound. Let us look at the details of this response.
The conceptual distinction to which the ambiguity response appeals is that between fallibilism and infallibilism. Infallibilism, defined as a gloss applicable to various approaches to the analysis of knowledge, can be defined as follows:
Infallibilism:
S's knowing that p requires S's satisfying an evidential or reliability condition C, such that it is not possible for S to satisfy C while p is false.
Infallibilism is the negation of fallibilism:
Fallibilism:
S's knowing that p requires satisfying an evidential or reliability condition C, but C is not such that it is impossible for S to satisfy C while p is false.
Applied to evidentialism, fallibilism is the view that knowledge-giving reasons need not be entailing reasons, whereas infallibilism is the view that knowledge-giving reasons must be entailing reasons. Equipped with this distinction, we can distinguish between a fallibilist and an infallibilist sense of the word ‘know’ and thus discriminate between three different versions of the BIV Argument:
V1 results from giving the word ‘know’ an infallibilist interpretation in the premises and a fallibilist interpretation in the conclusion; V2 results from giving the word ‘know’ a fallibilist interpretation in both the premises and the conclusion; V3 results from giving the word ‘know’ an infallibilist interpretation in the premises and the conclusion as well.
V1 is an instance of equivocation and thus obviously invalid. In response to V2, ambiguity theorists will concede that the argument has an upsetting conclusion, but claim that the argument is unsound because its second premise, ~K~B, is false. In response to V3, they will agree that the argument is sound. But they will not perceive this as a worrisome outcome, since they will say that the conclusion — I don't have infallible knowledge of my hands — is not at all surprising or remarkable. We can gladly admit that the extent of infallible knowledge is extremely limited. What matters is rather the extent of fallible knowledge. And as far as that is concerned, the BIV-Argument does not succeed in establishing a negative conclusion because the fallibilist interpretation of the second premise — I don't have fallible knowledge of my not being a BIV — is false.
If we assume that, when presenting the BIV-Argument, the Skeptic has infallible knowledge in mind, whereas the Anti-Skeptic is thinking of fallibilist knowledge, their disagreement will be merely verbal. They will both be right. But that, according to the ambiguity response, is no reason for the Skeptic to celebrate. For from the point of view of the ambiguity theory, the conclusion that we don't have infallible knowledge of our hands is completely unremarkable, and therefore nothing to worry about. [9]
The ambiguity response invites, among others, the following two objections. First, some would object that the fallilbilist concept of knowledge is incoherent. David Lewis, for example, rejects fallibilism:
If you are a contented fallibilist, I implore you to be honest, be naive, hear it afresh. ‘He knows, yet he has not eliminated all possibilities of error.’ Even if you've numbed your ears, doesn't this overt, explicit fallibilism still sound wrong?[10]
Second, it is not quite clear how one can have even fallibilist knowledge of one's not being a BIV. Skeptics who employ the BIV Hypothesis would say that there is no difference between my evidence in the normal world and my evidence in the vat-World. Therefore, I have simply no evidence at all in support of the belief that I am not a BIV. And if that is true, I don't even know fallibly that I am not a BIV. Hence, unless the ambiguity response is supplemented with an explanation of why ~K~B is false, it doesn't have much bite. Let us briefly examine how such a supplementary account might go.
5. Fallibilist Anti-Skepticism
Let us agree, then, that we are using the word ‘know’ in the fallibilist sense. In that sense of the word ‘know’, S's belief that p can be an instance of knowing that p even if S's evidence for p does not entail p. Now, it would appear that there are all kinds of things the non-existence of which is supported by non-entailing but nevertheless adequate evidence. About such things, we know that they don't exist. For example, you know that there isn't a million dollars hidden inside of your mattress. You know that there isn't a nuclear bomb in your basement. You know that the easter bunny, the Loch Ness Monster, and the abominable snowman don't exist. Likewise, you arguably know that the following does not exist: the know-how and technology needed for turning people into BIVs and making them suffer the delusion of a normal life. An advocate of the ambiguity response could, then, argue as follows:
Fallibilist Anti-BIV:
C* If I know that BIV know-how and technology do not exist, then I know that I am not a BIV. K~T I know that BIV know-how and technology do not exist. Therefore: K~B I know that I am not a BIV.
Does this argument beg the question against the BIV-Argument? It does not appeal to knowledge of my hands as a premise. Therefore, it certainly does not beg the question in the way in which, according to many epistemologists, Moorean Anti-BIV does. On the other hand, if I claim I know that BIV know-how and technology do not exist, then I implicitly appeal to knowledge of the external world. But knowledge of the external world is just what the BIV Argument ultimately calls into question. Thus, it might be argued, Fallibilist Anti-BIV begs the question after all.
However, whether Fallibilist Anti-BIV is indeed question-begging is far from clear. Consider a pair of arguments: an original argument, A, and a counter-argument, Anti-A, which denies one of the premises of A. Suppose Anti-A uses a premise that presupposes or somehow implies that A's conclusion is false. Is that by itself sufficient to render Anti-A question-begging? Let us suppose it is not.[11] Whether Anti-A is question-begging or not, let's suppose, depends on the evidence in support of the premises of each argument. Suppose there is one body of evidence supporting the premises of A, and another body of evidence supporting the premises of Anti-A. In that case, neither arguments begs the question against the other. Rather, the two arguments are simply a reflection of the fact that the total evidence available pulls into two different directions. The BIV Argument and Fallibilist Anti-BIV might be related in just that way. My mental states in the normal world and in the BIV world are identical. That's a reason for thinking I cannot know that I'm not a BIV. On the other hand, I have excellent reasons for thinking that the know-how and technology for turning people into BIVs does not exist. That's a reason for thinking I know after all that I'm not a BIV. Of course, these reasons might not be equally strong. If you think the latter reason is more decisive than the former, then you could conclude that Fallibilist Anti-BIV is indeed an effective rebuttal of the BIV-Argument.
6. The Contextualist Response
Contextualism is closely related to the ambiguity response. Like advocates of the ambiguity response, contextualists hold that what speakers mean when they use the word ‘knowledge’ is not always the same. However, whereas the ambiguity response says nothing about how the word ‘know’ acquires its meaning in specific contexts, contextualism focuses on just that question. Call a sentence of the form ‘S knows that p’ a knowledge attribution, and the subject who utters such a sentence the attributor. According to contextualism, the meaning of knowledge-attributions (which concept of knowledge the attributor has in mind) is fixed by the attributor's conversational context. If the conversation in which the attributor is engaged brings skeptical alternatives to the fore, then the attributor is in a high-standard context. As a result, the attributor's utterance, ‘S knows that p’ is true only if S's belief that p meets high standards of knowledge. If, on the other hand, skeptical alternatives are not salient at all in the attributor's conversational context, then the attributor is in a low-standard context. In such a context, an utterance such as ‘S knows that p’ can be true even if S meets merely low standards of knowledge.[12]
How are we to think of the distinction between low-standards and high-standards knowledge? The distinction pretty much corresponds to that between fallibilist and infallibilist knowledge. If I have low-standards knowledge of my hands, my epistemic situation allows for knowledge of my hands even though I could be in that very situation while not having hands. On the other hand, if I have high-standards knowledge of my hands, my epistemic situation allows for knowledge of my hands only if I could not be in that situation while not having hands.
The following pair of claims, then, is constitutive of contextualism: As long as error-possibilities are ignored, the standards of knowledge remain low, and the concept expressed by the word ‘knowledge’ is that of low-standard knowledge. But when error possibilities become salient, then the standards of knowledge rise. Thus speakers who are confronted with error possibilities have high-standard knowledge in mind when they utter knowledge attributions. According to contextualists, it is precisely this thought that affords us a satisfactory resolution of the skeptical paradox.
Contextualists point out that a satisfactory response must go beyond merely denying one of the premises of the BIV-Argument. Rather, a good response must explain why this argument makes us vacillate, why we find it both compelling and, at the same time, crazy.[13] Contextualism is supposed to provide us with just such an explanation. Here is how that explanation goes: When we consider the BIV Argument, the alternative of being a BIV becomes salient. As a result, our standards of knowledge rise and we have high-standard knowledge in mind when we use the word ‘know’. In a situation like that, we speak truly when we say ‘I don't know that I'm not a BIV’ and ‘I don't know that I have hands'. That explains the appeal of the BIV-Argument. On the other hand, when we are in ordinary situations and don't bother to consider skeptical alternatives, our standards of knowledge are low. We then speak truly when we say ‘I know I have hands’.[14] That explains why the conclusion of the BIV-Argument strikes us as crazy. The contextualist response to the skeptical paradox, then, achieves two things: it explains the appeal of the skeptical argument and rescues, at the same time, our conviction that we know we have hands.[15]
The contextualist literature has elicited many objections.[16] Let us focus on just two. First, we may wonder whether the meaning of knowledge attributions is really context-sensitive in just the way contextualists assert. According to contextualists, what speakers mean when they use the word ‘know’ is determined by the salience or non-salience of error-possibilities. When error possibilities are salient, the standards of knowledge rise. As long as error possibilities are ignored, they stay low. Thus, when speakers use the word ‘know’ in high-standards contexts, they have a demanding concept of knowledge in mind. In that demanding sense of ‘know’, we know very little. But as long as speakers remain in low-standard contexts, they have a non-demanding concept of knowledge in mind. In that low-standard sense of ‘know’, we know a lot. But does what we mean by ‘know’ really change in precisely that way? Obviously, there are exceptions. It seems safe to say that, when philosophers such as G. E. Moore or Roderick Chisholm considered skeptical alternatives, they meant by ‘knowledge’ exactly what they meant by that word in other, ordinary situations, simply because, as philosophers, they intended to use that word in a way consistent with their general views on the nature of knowledge. In fact, contextualists have acknowledged that it is possible to resist the upward pressure created by salient error possibilities. So they have made a concession: It's possible to retain a low-standard meaning of ‘knowledge’ in situations in which error-possibilities are salient.[17] What follows from the existence of philosophers (and perhaps some non-philosophers as well) whose use of the word ‘know’ does not vary from one context to another? What follows, we might conclude, is that the the word ‘know’ is less context-sensitive, and that the phenomenon of vacillation towards skepticism is less common, than contextualists suggest.
Second, we might wonder what benefits the appeal to contexts is expected to bestow. Isn't it the case that, whatever context we are in, we can always exercise the option of semantic ascent and distinguish between a fallibilist and an infallibilist meaning of ‘know’?
Consider an example contextualists are fond of using: what we mean by the word ‘tall’ is obviously sensitive to context. Suppose John's height is 6'6". In an ordinary context, we might say that John is tall. But a basketball coach might say John isn't tall. Clearly there is no contradicition between these utterances. Since the use of ‘tall’ in an ordinary context and in a basketball coach's context are governed by different standards, both utterances will be true. But such context sensitivity can easily be eliminated. The utterance ‘John is a tall person’ will be true in either context, and the utterance ‘John is not a tall basketball player’ will be true in either context. The device that enables us to ascend, so to speak, from context dependence to a higher semantic plane is that of conceptual disambiguation, in this case, the device of making a conceptual distinction between tall persons and tall basketball players.
Likewise, I can employ the ambiguity theory and make a conceptual distinction between fallibilist and infallibilist knowledge. This enables me to say ‘I have fallibilist knowledge of my hands' and ‘I fallibly know that I'm not a BIV’, and to say ‘I don't have infallible knowledge of my hands’ and ‘I don't infallibly know that I'm not a BIV’. The meaning of such utterances is not at all context-sensitive. Arguably, they will be true in any context. Why, then, should we think that a satisfactory response to skepticism requires of us to appeal to context?
Contextualists might reply that, when we compare contextualism with the ambiguity response, contextualism is superior in the following respect: it enables us to explain why our reaction to skepticism is that of vacillation, of finding skeptical arguments both crazy and compelling. Ambiguity theorists, however, would say they can explain the vacillation phenomenon without appealing to the context-sensitivity of the word ‘know’. Whether we know, even in the fallibilist sense of ‘know’, that we are not BIVs is not an easy question to decide. My mental states in the vat world mirror my mental states in the normal world. That's a good reason for thinking I can't have any evidence at all for concluding I'm not a BIV, and therefore can't even have fallibilist knowledge of not being a BIV. On the other hand, I do seem to have good reasons for thinking that BIV technology does not exist. If that's true, and if the appeal to such reasons is not question-begging, then I do have fallibilist knowledge of not being a BIV. So whether or not I can know I'm not a BIV is, even when we consider fallible knowledge, a complicated question. That's why it's possible to experience vacillation when trying to resolve the skeptical paradox, and why this paradox is unlikely to be resolved to everybody's satisfaction.[18]