Supplement to John Locke
The Immateriality of the Soul and Personal Identity
Both in his discussion of personal identity and in his discussion of the immateriality of the soul in Book IV of the Essay Locke is agnostic about the immateriality of the soul. In Book IV he suggests that immateriality is not needed for the great ends of religion, and in Book II he crafts a theory of personal identity that does not require (though it is not inconsistent with) the immateriality of the soul.
The Immateriality of the Soul
In giving us his estimate of the limits of human understanding, Locke made some claims which surprised his contemporaries. In IV 3, 6 he suggests that given our ignorance of substances, it was possible that God could make matter fitly disposed think. He suggested that it was no farther beyond our comprehension that motions of the body could give rise to pleasure and pain than that an immaterial soul could feel pain after the occurrence of some motions in the body. He suggested that the immateriality of the soul was not particularly important. In a passage from Book IV, Chapter 2, section 6, Locke writes:
All the great ends of Morality and Religion, are well enough secured without the philosophical Proofs of the Soul's Immateriality; since it is evident that he who, at first made us beings to subsist here, sensible intelligent Beings, and for several years continued us in such a state, can and will restore us to a like state of Sensibility in another World, and make us there capable to receive the Retribution he has designed to men, according to the doings in this life. And therefore tis not a mighty necessity to determine one way or t'other, as some overzealous for or against the Immateriality of the Soul, have been foreward to make the World believe.
These suggestions were often taken as stronger than intended. Many of Locke's critics were suspicious that Locke had materialist tendencies. Instead of the skeptical conclusions about immaterial versus material substance that Locke is clearly arguing for, his remarks were sometimes treated as proposing that matter can and does think. It hardly matters however. Samuel Clarke, for example, a student of Newton's and an orthodox Anglican theologian, engaged in a debate by correspondence or rather public pamphlet with Anthony Collins over this issue between 1706 and 1708. Clarke sought to show that from our ideas alone it would be possible to show that matter thinking would involve a contradiction. If Clarke is right, Locke (even on the weaker interpretation I am proposing) would be wrong. There was an explosion of refutations of the claim that for all we know matter can think and the discussion of this issue lasted at least three quarters of the way through the eighteenth century.
Personal Identity
Locke added his Chapter “Of Identity and Diversity” (II. xxvii) which gives his account of identity and personal identity to the second edition of the Essay. Locke's account of personal identity turned out to be revolutionary. His account of personal identity is embedded in a general account of identity. In this general account of identity Locke distinguishes between the identity of atoms, masses of atoms and living things. Each individual atom is the same at a time, and stays the same over time. So, there is no problem about the identity of atoms. Masses of atoms are individuated by their constituent atoms without regard to the way in which they are organized. Living things, by contrast, are individuated by their functional organization. This organization is instantiated at any time by a collection of atoms. But the organization can persist through changes in the particles which make it up — at least gradual change which continues the functions which the organization performs. Clearly the most important of these functions is the continuation of the same life. It is the continuation of the same functional organization and thus the same life which is the criterion of identity for sameness of living thing, be it an oak or a horse. Locke holds that man is an animal and is thus individuated just like other living things. So ‘man’ refers to a living body of a particular shape. Locke is perfectly aware that the definition of man is not really settled, and that there are a variety of competing definitions. He argues for his own definition, which involves distinguishing between ‘man’ and ‘person’ by using a variety of thought experiments and deducing unacceptable consequences from competing definitions. He points out, for example, that while those who individuate man solely in terms of the possession of a soul can explain the sameness of man from infancy to old age, if they accept some doctrine of reincarnation, their definition requires that the same soul in different bodies be the same man as much as infant and old man. If the doctrine of reincarnation allows the soul of a man to be reborn in the body of an animal, such as a hog, if we knew that the soul of a man was in one of our hogs, it would require us to call the hog a man. Locke pairs the examples of a rational talking parrot with a creature that has the shape of a man but cannot engage in rational discourse as a thought experiment which demonstrates that rational discourse is neither a necessary or sufficient condition for being a man. If man is a living body, an animal of a certain shape, then what is a person? A person is an intelligent thinking being that can know itself as itself the same thinking thing in different times and places.
Why does Locke make this distinction between ‘man’ and ‘person?’ One answer is that the distinction solves the problem of the resurrection of the dead. What is this problem? The problem begins with Biblical texts asserting that we will have the same body at the Resurrection as we did in this life. The issue is in what sense this is true. Clearly there are problems with the supposition that one will. Robert Boyle, in his essay, “Some Physico-Theological Considerations About the Possibility of the Resurrection” had raised some of these puzzles. Boyle writes:
When a man is once really dead, divers of the parts of his body will, according to the course of nature, resolve themselves into multitudes of steams that wander to and fro in the air; and the remaining parts, that are either liquid or soft, undergo so great a corruption and change, that it is not possible so many scattered parts should be again brought together, and reunited after the same manner, wherein the existed in a human body whilst it was yet alive. And much more impossible it is to effect this reunion, if the body have been, as it often happens, devoured by wild beasts or fishes; since in this case, though the scattered parts of the cadaver might be recovered as particles of matter, yet already having passed into the substance of other animals, they are quite transmuted, as being informed by the new form of the beast or fish that devoured them and of which they now make a substantial part. (Robert Boyle, Selected Philosophical Papers of Robert Boyle, ed. M.A. Stewart, Manchester University Press, New York, 1979. p. 198.
These difficulties with putting bodies back together are obviously considerable, though not perhaps beyond the powers of Omnipotence. The culminating problem, however, is what happens to the man whose body is eaten by cannibals? Boyle continues:
And yet far more impossible will this reintegration be, if we put the case that the dead man was devoured by cannibals; for then, the same flesh belonging successively to two different persons, it is impossible that both should have it restored to them at once, or that any footsteps should remain of the relation it had to the first possessor.
These problems I suspect represent the kinds of difficulties which faced the scientists of the Royal Society, and with which Boyle was particularly concerned, in integrating the kinds of explanations of natural phenomena in terms of particles and matter in motion, with the truths of religion.
Locke explicitly tells us that the case of the prince and the cobbler shows us the resolution of the problem of the resurrection. The case is one in which the soul of the prince with all of its princely thoughts is transferred from the body of the prince to the body of the cobbler, the cobbler's soul having departed. The result of this exchange, is that the prince still consider himself the prince, even though he finds himself in an altogether new body. Locke's distinction between man and person makes it possible for the same person to show up in a different body at the resurrection and yet still be the same person. Locke focuses on the prince with all his princely thoughts because, on his view, it is consciousness which is crucial to the reward and punishment which is to be meted out at the Last Judgment. In this chapter on identity, Locke is also making a distinction between consciousness and the soul, but that distinction is not crucial to the resolution of the kinds of problems that Boyle considered in his essay on the resurrection. Let us turn then, to the distinction between soul and consciousness.
Though the distinction between man and person is controversial, Locke's distinction between the soul or the thing which thinks in us and consciousness is even more radical. Locke holds that consciousness can be transferred from one soul to another, and that personal identity goes with consciousness. In section 12 of the Chapter of Identity and Diversity he raises the question: “…if the same Substance which thinks be changed, it can be the same person, or remaining the same, it can be a different person.” Locke's answer to both of these questions is affirmative. Consciousness can be transferred from one substance to another and thus while the soul is changed, consciousness remains the same and thus personal identity is preserved through the change. And on the other hand, consciousness can be lost as in utter forgetfulness while the soul or thinking substance remains the same. Under these conditions there is the same soul but a different person. These affirmations amount to the claim that the same soul or thinking substance is neither necessary not sufficient for personal identity over time. The arguments are developed by analogy with the functional organization of animals which is preserved through the gradual changes in the atoms which instantiate that organization at any given time. So, at any given time there must be a soul or thinking substance, but over time there is no necessity that one have the same soul to preserve personal identity.
Why does Locke make this distinction between soul and consciousness? This distinction has little bearing on problems about the same body at the resurrection. Still, the resurrection is important. I would suggest that the answer lies in Locke's interest in justice at the final judgment. Locke is skeptical about our ability to reidentify the same soul over time. He claims that if we were always awake, we could be certain that we had the same soul. But consciousness has natural gaps in it, such as periods during which we are asleep. Locke claims that there is no way of knowing that one soul has not been substituted for another during this period of absence of consciousness.
I would argue that the whole force of Locke's definition of person as a thinking intelligent being that can know itself as the same thinking thing in different times and places is designed to account for the fact that we are creatures who are capable of operating the machinery of the law. When contemplating an action we can think that in the future we will be the same being who will be punished or rewarded for the course of action which we choose. When being punished we can look back and see that we are the same being who committed the act for which we are being punished. Locke holds that consciousness is essential for justice to be done. If one is punished for doing something which one does not remember doing, it is equivalent to being created miserable. So, since consciousness plays the most important role in our being punished or rewarded at the last judgment for our actions, and consciousness can be transferred from one soul to another, and we have no mechanism to reidentify souls over time, it becomes clear why consciousness is Locke's choice for the bearer of personal identity, and why he makes the distinction between the substance which thinks in us and consciousness. I think this account explains a variety of oddities and difficulties in Locke's account. On his account, for example, memory must be completely accurate — at least in the respects relevant for divine judicial purposes. Evidence which others might produce about one's identity has no role to play and so forth. Locke's account of freedom of action is also connected with his view of the forensic nature of personal identity. Freedom to review the decisions one has made about how to act are clearly of great importance in being able to operate the law. If one could not pause to consider, and change one's mind about what one was going to do, it might well be said that one could not do otherwise.