Proof of the Falsification Theorem

Here we prove a version of the Falsification Theorem that only assumes condition-independence. In the following, if result-independence holds as well, all occurrences of ‘(c^k−1·e^k−1)’ may be dropped, which gives the theorem stated in the main text. If neither independence condition holds, the following proof still works, but with all occurrences of ‘c_k·(c^k−1·e^k−1)’ replaced by ‘cⁿ·e^k−1’ and with occurrences of ‘b·c^k−1’ replaced by ‘b·cⁿ’.

Theorem 1: The Falsification Theorem:
Suppose c^m, a subsequence of the whole evidence sequence cⁿ, consists of experiments or observations with the following property: whenever an outcome sequence e^k−1 of past conditions c^k−1 is deemed possible by both h_j·b and h_i·b, there are outcomes o_ku of the next condition c_k deemed impossible by h_j·b but deemed possible by h_i·b to at least some small degree δ. That is, suppose there is a δ > 0 such that for each c^k−1 and each of its outcome sequences e^k−1, if P[e^k−1 | h_i·b·c^k−1] > 0 and P[e^k−1 | h_j·b·c^k−1] > 0, then it is also the case that P[∨ {o_ku:P[o_ku | h_j·b·c_k·(c^k−1·e^k−1)] = 0} | h_i·b·c_k·(c^k−1·e^k−1)]  ≥  δ. Then,

P[∨{eⁿ : P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ]/P[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ] = 0} | h_i·b·cⁿ]
    = P[∨{eⁿ : P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ] = 0} | h_i·b·cⁿ]
    ≥ 1−(1−δ)^m,

which approaches 1 for large m.

Proof

First notice that for each c_k from c^m,

(1−γ)	≥	P[∨u{oku : P[oku | hj·b·ck] > 0} | hi·b·ck·(ck−1·ek−1)]
	=	∑{oku∈Ok: P[oku | hj·b·ck] > 0} P[oku | hi·b·ck·(ck−1·ek−1)].

And for each c_k not from c^m,

P[∨_u{o_ku : P[o_ku | h_j·b·c_k] > 0} | h_i·b·c_k·(c^k−1·e^k−1)]  = 1.

Then,

  P[∨{eⁿ : P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ] > 0} | h_i·b·cⁿ]

=	∑{en:P[en|hj·b·cn] > 0} P[en|hi·b·cn]
=	∑{en−1: P[en−1|hj·b·cn−1] > 0} (∑{onu∈On:P[onu|hj·b·cn·(cn−1·en−1)] > 0} P[onu|hi·b·cn·(cn−1·en−1)]) · P[en−1|hi·b·cn−1]
=	∑{en−1: P[en−1|hj·b·cn−1] > 0} P[∨u{onu : P[onu|hj·b·cn·(c n−1·en−1)] > 0}|hi·b·cn·(cn−1·en−1)] · P[en−1|hi·b·cn−1]
≤	(1−γ) · ∑{en−1: P[en−1|hj·b·cn−1] > 0} P[en−1|hi·b·cn−1] (if cn is from cm)
or
=	∑{en−1: P[en−1|hj·b·cn−1] > 0}P[en−1|hi·b·cn−1] (if cn is not from cm)
…
≤	m Π k = 1 (1−γ)=(1−γ)m.

So,

P[∨{eⁿ : P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ] = 0} | h_i·b·cⁿ] ≥  1 − (1−γ)ⁿ.

Also,

P[∨{eⁿ : P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ]/P[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ] = 0} | h_i·b·cⁿ] = P[∨{eⁿ : P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ] = 0} | h_i·b·cⁿ],

because

P[∨{eⁿ : P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ]/P[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ] > 0} | h_i·b·cⁿ]

=	∑{en: P[en | hj·b·cn]/P[en | hi·b·cn] > 0} P[en | hi·b·cn]
=	∑{en: P[en | h j·b·cn] > 0 & P[en | hi·b·cn] > 0} P[en | hi·b·cn]
=	∑{en: P[en | h j·b·cn] > 0} P[en | hi·b·cn]
=	P[∨{en : P[en | hj·b·cn] > 0} | hi·b·cn].

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Copyright © 2008 by
James Hawthorne <hawthorne@ou.edu>