Inductive Logic > Proof that the EQI for cn is the sum of EQI for the individual ck (Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy/Summer 2010 Edition)

Supplement to Inductive Logic

Proof that the EQI for cⁿ is the sum of EQI for the individual c_k

In order to accomodate the more general result that does not presuppose the independence conditions we must first generalize the definitions of QI and of EQI. In what follows we will treat the case where only condition-independence is assumed. If result-independence holds as well, all occurrences of ‘(c^k−1·e^k−1)’ may be dropped, which gives the theorem stated in the text. If neither independence condition holds, all occurrences of ‘c_k·(c^k−1·e^k−1)’ are replaced by ‘cⁿ·e^k−1’ and occurrences of ‘b·c^k−1’ are replaced by ‘b·cⁿ’.

Definition: QI — the Quality of the Information.
For each experiment or observation c_k, define the quality of the information provided by o_ku for distinguishing h_j from h_i (given b·c_k, relative to the past evidence (c^k−1·e^k−1)), as follows:

QI[o_ku | h_i/h_j | b·c_k·(c^k−1·e^k−1)] = log[P[o_ku | h_i·b·c_k·(c^k−1·e^k−1)] / P[o_ku | h_j·b·c_k·(c^k−1·e^k−1)]].

Similarly, define:

QI[eⁿ | h_i/h_j | b·cⁿ] = log[P[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ] / P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ]].

Definition: EQI — the Expected Quality of the Information.
Let's call h_j outcome-compatible with h_i on evidence stream c^k just when for each possible outcome sequence e^k of c^k, if P[e^k | h_i·b·c^k] > 0, then P[e^k | h_j·b·c^k] > 0.

We also adopt the following convention:

If P[o_ku | h_j·b·c_k·(c^k−1·e^k−1)] = 0, then the term QI[o_ku | h_i/h_j | b·c_k·(c^k−1·e^k−1)] · P[o_ku | h_i·b·c_k·(c^k−1·e^k−1)] = 0, since the outcome o_ku has 0 probability of occurring given h_i·b·c_k·(c^k−1·e^k−1).

Now, for h_j outcome-compatible with h_i on c^k, we define

EQI[c_k | h_i/h_j | b·(c^k−1·e^k−1)] = ∑_u QI[o_ku | h_i/h_j | b·c_k·(c^k−1·e^k−1)]· P[o_ku | h_i·b·c_k·(c^k−1·e^k−1)];

and define

EQI[c_k | h_i/h_j | b·c^k−1] = ∑_{e^k−1} EQI[c_k | h_i/h_j | b·(c^k−1·e^k−1)] · P[e^k−1 | h_i·b·c^k−1].

Also define

EQI[cⁿ | h_i/h_j | b] = ∑_{eⁿ} QI[eⁿ | h_i/h_j | b] · P[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ].

Then we have the following generalization of Equation (16) in the main text:

Theorem: The EQI Decomposition Theorem:

EQI[cⁿ | h_i/h_j | b] = n
∑
k = 1 EQI[c_k |h_i/h_j | b·c^k−1].

Proof:

EQI[cⁿ | h_i/h_j | b]

= ∑_{eⁿ} QI[eⁿ | h_i/h_j | b·cⁿ] · P[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ]

= ∑_{eⁿ} log[P[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ]/P[eⁿ | h_j·b·cⁿ]] · P[eⁿ | h_i·b·cⁿ]

= ∑_{eⁿ⁻¹} ∑_{{e_n}} (log[P[e_n | h_i·b·c_n·(cⁿ⁻¹·eⁿ⁻¹)]/P[e_n | h_j·b·c_n·(cⁿ⁻¹·eⁿ⁻¹)]] + log[P[eⁿ⁻¹ | h_i·b·cⁿ⁻¹]/P[eⁿ⁻¹ | h_j·b·cⁿ⁻¹]]) ·
P[e_n | h_i·b·c_n·(cⁿ⁻¹·eⁿ⁻¹)] · P[eⁿ⁻¹ | h_i·b·cⁿ⁻¹]

= (∑_{eⁿ⁻¹} ∑_{{e_n}} log[P[e_n | h_i·b·c_n·(cⁿ⁻¹·eⁿ⁻¹)]/P[e_n | h_j·b·c_n·(cⁿ⁻¹·eⁿ⁻¹)]] · P[e_n | h_i·b·c_n·(cⁿ⁻¹·eⁿ⁻¹)] · P[eⁿ⁻¹ | h_i·b·cⁿ⁻¹]) + (∑_{eⁿ⁻¹} log[P[eⁿ⁻¹ | h_i·b·cⁿ⁻¹]/P[eⁿ⁻¹ | h_j·b·cⁿ⁻¹]] · P[eⁿ⁻¹ | h_i·b·cⁿ⁻¹] · ∑_{{e_n}} P[e_n | h_i·b·c_n·(cⁿ⁻¹·eⁿ⁻¹)])

= EQI[c_n | h_i/h_j | b·cⁿ⁻¹] + EQI[cⁿ⁻¹ | h_i/h_j | b]

= …

=

n
∑
k = 1 EQI[c_k | h_i/h_j | b·c^k−1].

The average expected quality of information then becomes:

Definition: The Average Expected Quality of Information

EQI[cⁿ | h_i/h_j | b] = EQI[cⁿ | h_i/h_j | b] ÷ n

=

(1/n) n
∑
k = 1 EQI[c_k | h_i/h_j | b·c^k−1].

[Back to Text]