Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Supplement to Relevance Logic

The Logic S

Here is a Hilbert-style axiomatisation of the logic S (for “syllogism”).

Our language contains propositional variables, parentheses and one connective: implication.

Axiom Scheme Axiom Name
1. (BC) →((AB) →(AC)) Prefixing
2. (AB) →((BC) →(AC)) Suffixing

Rule Name
AB, AB Modus Ponens

The logic T-W is S with the addition of the identity axiom (AA). Martin's theorem is that no instance of the identity axiom is a theorem of S. It is a corollary of Martin's theorem that in T-W if both AB and BA are provable, then A and B are the same formula (see Anderson, Belnap, and Dunn (1992) §66).