Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Supplement to Actualism
Background Assumptions for Plantingas Account
There are several background assumptions that are required for
Plantingas solution to be adequate
(P1)
| Worlds are (maximal possible) states of affairs.
|
That is, Plantinga adopts the approach sketched in the supplementary
document An
Account of Abstract Possible Worlds on which possible worlds are
abstract states of affairs that actually exist but (in general) dont
obtain. Plantinga thus avoids the first aspect of the possibilist
challenge.
(P2)
| Properties are "first-class citizens"; that is, they
are legitimate objects of reference and (first-order) quantification;
|
If individual essences are to play the role that possibilia play in
Kripkes account, then, clearly, it must be possible to quantify over
them directly with first-order quantifiers. Plantinga is a platonist
--- properties, propositions, and states of affairs are as real as
any concrete particular, its just that they are abstract. Hence,
they can be quantified over no less than their concrete counterparts.
The advantages of this move are clear. As noted above, Kripkes
account fails to be actualist because it quantifies over possibilia
in the metalanguage. By replacing possibilia with individual
essences, quantifiers range over essences, and hence only over
actually existing things.
(P3)
| Properties, propositions, and states of affairs all exist necessarily.
|
As noted in the main document, unlike (most, at least) concrete
particulars, properties are necessary beings for Plantinga; it is not
possible that there be a property that might fail to exist.
Consequently, necessarily, any property that exists in any possible
world exists in all possible worlds. (That is, in terms of
Plantingas actualist reconstruction of worlds, necessarily, if a
propertys existence is entailed by any possible world, it is
entailed by all possible worlds.) It follows, in particular, that
individual essences are necessary beings.
Why is (P3) needed? After all, in general, not all possibilia exist
in every possible world in Kripkes semantics and hence, it would
seem, they are not necessary beings; more formally, NE is not a
logical truth in Kripkes system. However, the fact that NE fails in
Kripkes theory is simply an artifact of his semantics for the
quantifiers --- quantifiers at a given world w range only over
the things that exist in w, and hence, that NE is not a
logical truth in Kripkes system only reflects the fact that not all
possibilia exist in, i.e., are actual in, every
possible world. However, all possibilia are in a clear sense
there at each world all the same; Kripke could just as
easily have defined the semantics of the quantifiers so that they
ranged over all of them. (Indeed, in his original model theory, a
1-place predicate at a world w can have possibilia that do not
exist in w in its extension.) He chose not to define the
semantics of the quantifiers in this way simply to avoid validating
BF, CBF, and NE and thus to have at least an actualistically
acceptable proof theory. Thus, although there is no object language
theorem expressing that possibilia are necessary beings, this is
clearly an important metaphysical consequence of his semantics, and
hence it needs to be reflected in Plantingas solution.
The necessity of individual essences is still not enough, though.
For if individual essences are to replace possibilia, then we must be
assured that there are enough of them, that, crudely put, for "every
possible individual" there is a corresponding individual essence.
This is guaranteed by the following principle:
(P4)
| Necessarily, every object has an individual essence.
|
Return to Actualism
Copyright © 2000 by
Christopher Menzel
cmenzel@tamu.edu
First published: June 16, 2000
Content last modified: June 16, 2000