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H(x = H & H F)We can name this concept using our -notation as follows:
[x H(x = H & H F)]Instead of writing out this lengthy expression being an x which is an extension of a concept equinumerous to F, let us abbreviate our -notation for this concept as F#. Note that the extension of this concept, F#(), contains only extensions as members.
Now Freges explicit definition of the number of Fs can be given as follows:
#F =df F#()This definition identifies the number of Fs as the extension that contains all and only those extensions of concepts that are equinumerous to F.
We can complete our preliminary work for the proof of Humes Principle by formulating and proving the following Lemma (derived from Basic Law V), which simplifies the proof of Humes Principle:
Lemma for Humes Principle:This Lemma tells us that an extension such as G will be a member of #F just in case G is equinumerous to F. Clearly, since F is equinumerous to itself, it follows that #F contains F as a member. From these facts, one can get a sense of how Frege derived Humes Principle Basic Law V in Gg. Here is a reconstruction of the argument.
G #F G F
Proof of Humes Principle from Basic Law V
Return to Freges Logic, Theorem, and Foundations for Arithmetic
First published: June 10, 1998
Content last modified: June 10, 1998